Maybe the world is like an armillary sphere. Metallic balls representing celestial objects are placed just-so along spherical rings, tracing an at-first bewildering but ultimately regular dance following pre-determined longitudinal and latitudinal steps. Complex, intricate patterns are mapped out in accordance with some master plan, perhaps by some master designer, built with extraordinary care by some master metalsmith.
Such a world is beautiful, elegant, intelligible. Predictable. Ultimately: boring.
Perhaps the world is like a series of tidepools clustered atop a rocky outcrop stretching across a beach. The ocean’s flow fills and mixes the pools, while its ebb and withdrawal leave aquatic refugia. The tide sets a clock of sorts, or at least an irregular rhythm, while also mixing and randomizing, leaving a stray lobster here, a surprise fish there. The varying morphology of the rocks creates differences across pools. In one, an overhang provides the perfect hiding spot for a camouflaged octopus, in others, exposure to the sun makes for a seaweed forest in miniature. Chance, rock morphology, and the beat of the tide all influence each pool’s particular character, its mix of barnacles, anemone, crabs, starfish and the remaining intertidal menagerie.
Such a world is beautiful, messy, mysterious. Unpredictable. Ultimately: exciting.
In Science for a Fragile World, Robert Northcott examines how scientists confront tidepool-like circumstances. Abstract generalized theory-building won’t allow us to predict or explain a tidepool’s occupants. Instead, we must go local, examining each pool. By the former strategy, ‘stability theorist’, we assume (hope) that the regularities described by theories hold generally. A plausible approach in worlds that operate analogously to armillary spheres. By the latter strategy, we are caseworkers: a method built for tidepools.
In under-200-snappy-pages, Northcott introduces and defends his notion of ‘fragility’ and its methodological consequences, in conversation with a battery of cases across history, economics, invasion biology, epidemiology, medicine, political science, and meteorology. Northcott makes a sustained and plausible case that divvying up scientific work along the duality of stability-theorizing and caseworking is a powerful way of understanding a wide range of important issues, especially regarding the strategies adopted in social sciences. This includes a particularly crisp defence of qualitative methods (107-110), a powerful argument against theory monism in economics (chapter 8) and, in the closing discussion, a nicely contextualist account of caseworker expertise.
The book does much in few pages, providing a powerful defence of scientific knowledge that embraces (rather than idealizing away from) the world’s exciting, messy and unpredictable nature. I’ll cover Northcott’s basic machinery and arguments, before turning to some thoughts about theory, explanation and fragility.
What makes a tidepool fragile in Northcott’s sense? Relations are ‘fragile’ when the world and our knowledge conspire against making (some relevant range of) predictions concerning them. Plausibly, tidepool assembly (in which critters are present) is related to diverse variables including rock morphology, tide height and the ocean’s capacity to mix and distribute. These relations are unstable. They hold intermittently: sometimes the tide drops off a surprise visitor, sometimes it doesn’t. That intermittency is unsystematic. For instance, while we might have a well-grounded hunch that bigger tidepools are more likely to be populated by a biodiverse fauna—and indeed might be able to establish this statistically—this tells us very little about the assemblage of a particular tidepool. If the sea happens to deliver a yellow-bellied sea snake, and she transforms the tidepool into a nursery, dramatic consequences follow for the pool’s composition. Many factors influence tidepool assemblage, and these are contingent and interact in complex ways. The composition of a tidepool is not predictable. Tidepools, then, are fragile. What are the consequences of fragility?
Northcott’s work sits solidly amongst philosophers of science who claim the world is fragile or disordered or dappled or contingent (iykyk). Science for a Fragile World aims to differ by providing a positive methodological story. The point isn’t simply to argue that the world contains many tidepool-like phenomena, but to further characterize how a science of tidepools should look. Hence, Northcott’s discussion of caseworker methodology. For an armillary sphere, once I’ve watched mercury whizz pass sufficiently often, I can happily predict mercury’s position vis-à-vis that of another planet, or by tracking time. Between tidepools, theories might hold imperfectly, or not at all, or interaction effects—the presence of a predatory octopus spoiling our sea-snake nursery—render predictions either false or too complex to meaningfully integrate without close examination. There is no theory of tidepool assemblage that tells us just what, given some set of initial conditions, we should expect to find in a given tidepool. But there is a set of approximate regularities about tidepools that could be brought to bear in understanding them. Caseworkers draw on a battery of theories—from abstract equations to empirical generalizations to heuristics—tailoring their knowledge to each particular case. They work with fragility, not in spite of it.
Stability-theorizing is seductive: enamoured with generality and systematicity, we might develop theory independently from empirical touchstones, or determinedly give theories (as Northcott puts it) ‘one more heave’ in the face of fragility. This strategy does poorly for tidepools. Even when general (‘wide-scope’) theories are applicable, in fragile cases, their warrant is narrow-scope, that is, turning on relatively fine-grained details of the case at hand. Zooming in is crucial not simply for explaining tokens, but for developing theoretical machinery through both refinement and identifying the need for new theories.
My ideas and Northcott’s are cut from similar cloth, so perhaps it is unsurprising that I find Science for a Fragile World compelling. I do think there’s more to say regarding the role of theories in fragile worlds, especially in their explanatory guises. Northcott’s definitional reliance on prediction might underplay this, as prediction and explanation are related but infamously non-equivalent. To explore this thought, let’s start with experiments.
Northcott understands both laboratory experiments and statistical methods as controlling for noise: strategies for identifying regularities despite the world’s messiness. But, he insists, noise differs from fragility. A perfectly clean signal from one set of cases might not project across another set. Northcott argues the lab doesn’t escape fragility (101-103). First, fragility ensures that results cannot be safely extrapolated: external validity is a case-by-case affair. Second, lab-driven theoretical refinements have little to tell us about application: “When relations are fragile, we need case studies in the context of use or in contexts similar to it—and that is rarely a laboratory” (103). I’m less sure on this point; it assumes that what matters in developing theoretical resources is application to individual concrete situations. There are at least two other functions I can think of.
First, experimentation can help us understand theories for their own sake, as more-or-less concrete instantiations of theoretical work. Take the ecological principle of competitive exclusion. The idea was developed in tandem with lab work: it was noticed that species with overlapping ecological roles in freely-mixing homogenous environments do not coexist for long. This can both be expressed using equations (typically population growth models) and exemplified in laboratory settings. The coupled exploration of the theory across different mediums (mathematical and concrete) generates a kind of modal know-how about the theory whilst revealing new theoretical phenomena. Theoretical modelling and lab-work can be excellent testbeds for new ideas, and understanding theories in these ways, perhaps, can still aid in their applicability to particular fragile instances. This only goes so far: I share Northcott’s worries about theoretical and lab-based sciences diverging too far from the empirical world they’re supposed to make sense of.
Second, while particular fragile relations require casework, token episodes do not exhaust what wants explaining. We also care about trends, patterns: the coarse-grained as well as the fine-grained. It could easily be that (let’s imagine), statistically speaking, bigger tidepools are more biodiverse. There could be several interlocking factors explaining this in particular instances. Bigger size means bigger catchment, increasing the likelihood that different species will find themselves in refugia. Larger tidepools are more likely to host heterogeneous environments (sunnier and darker spots due to rock morphology, say), and, by competitive exclusion, we should expect more biodiversity in heterogeneous environments. The fragility of the particular relations in token cases doesn’t stop us from trying to explain such trends, and general theories and models defined and understood through controlled, artificial experimentation seems like a powerful tool for doing just that. I suspect this point can be generalized.
With some exceptions, The Science of Fragile Worlds often focuses on token events and episodes, as opposed to patterns and trajectories. We might not be able to predict some patterns and trajectories into the future, but that doesn’t mean that we can’t explain them. And sometimes broad-scope, theory-driven approaches might be just right for doing so. When we’re interested in what a set of cases have in common, in explaining their common trajectories (despite individual fragility), in the right circumstances, I think quite general explanatory theories—wide scope both in range and warrant—do the job.
For instance, does evolution by natural selection explain life’s design-like features? To a first approximation, yes. But not entirely: drift, developmental constraint, and other elements technically absent from the strict neo-Darwinian recipe play crucial roles in token cases. More carefully, we might ask whether natural selection explains the presence of adaptations. I’m tempted to say yes. But this isn’t quite because natural selection reliably produces adaptation. Natural selection, without interference, does produce adaptation, but there is always interference. Any particular instance of natural selection will likely be fragile (proudly wearing my contingentist badge), so we need to casework, attend to specific details, to make sense of them. Yet, nonetheless, in explaining a general, abstract phenomena, the general, abstract theory of natural selection seems to do work.
I’m imagining circumstances where some general model (1) partially explains particular fragile relations—it is well-used by the caseworker by being combined and integrated with other models—but also (2) explains a general pattern discernible from amongst the fragile relations. Why any particular case turned out the way it did is due to a wild variety of diverse reasons, but why there is a general trend or pattern across them could be explained by a simple model (or sometimes not—there’s no guarantee here). The relations in the base are not stable, the model represents the relation as if it were stable, and yet it does seem as if, by representing a mechanism explaining an overall trend, the model is explanatory of the overall trend. Here, we have wide-scope explanation for fragile phenomena.
Northcott might respond by saying that I’ve simply identified a kind of stability, and it’s no surprise on his view that wide-scope theories work for stable cases. Yet it is often thought that such theories aren’t predictive: they don’t predict trends but explain them. He might want to say that such theories aren’t explanatory after all, or we can predict them, or that the trends themselves are statistical mirages. Regardless, I do have a hunch that Northcott’s focus on prediction potentially gives the role of general explanatory theories shorter shrift than they deserve.
As Northcott shows, much flows from a recognition of fragility’s importance: caseworker methodology should be embraced, as should theory pluralism and (to sneak in my favoured term) ‘methodological omnivory’. There will be no grand, unified theory for the social sciences, and we shouldn’t waste our time looking. Various other methods—classical statistics, the number-crunching of big data, and so on—will never be a panacea to fragility. But this is not a limit to our knowledge per se, but due to using methodologies built for a stable world; mistaking tidepools for armillary spheres. We can have knowledge of fragile worlds, but this knowledge is local and draws on a plurality of perspectives, that is, it is the knowledge of a caseworker.
For what it is worth, I also think the fragility of our world matters beyond our predictive and explanatory purposes. Fragility is partly what makes the world diverse, challenging and surprising; unique, peculiar and valuable. Fragility makes the world worth living in.