When the universities at Oxford and Paris were founded at the start of the thirteenth century, they took as their undergraduate curriculum the philosophical treatises of Aristotle. Given the intrinsic difficulty of those texts, it was inevitable, then as now, that a secondary literature of commentaries would grow up around that curriculum. This practice had begun already in late antiquity, mainly in Greek, and then shifted to the Islamic world, where Arabic translations of nearly the whole corpus yielded a new harvest of commentaries. When Aristotle finally made his way fully into Latin, these labors started anew.
Richard Rufus of Cornwall belongs to the first generation of scholars to write commentaries on the expanded corpus of the Latin Aristotle. Although his dates of birth and death are unknown, we know that, from the early 1230s until the later 1250s, he taught philosophy at Paris and then—after joining the Franciscan order—theology at Oxford. That we know much at all about Rufus is due mainly to the efforts of Rega Wood, who for more than two decades has been engaged in the Herculean task of editing his substantial body of work. Already in print are his commentaries on the Physics,Generation and Corruption, and the De anima. With these two massive volumes, we now have the entirety of his principal commentary on Aristotle’s Metaphysics. Following Wood, Neil Lewis, and Jennifer Ottman, we will call it SMet.
Wood dates SMet to 1237–38. There are doubts about that, and a few lingering doubts even about whether the work should be attributed to Rufus. We find persuasive, however, the case that the editors make for their conclusions in the lengthy and historically scrupulous introduction to the first volume. The attribution is worth fighting over, because SMet is a substantial and philosophically impressive work. As is common in this genre, it intersperses a literal paraphrase of the text with a series of disputed questions about the material. The questions are often interesting—we discuss several examples below—and Rufus’s treatment had considerable influence on later discussions. That this should be so is not surprising since, as the Introduction to the first volume begins, SMet was “the first major medieval treatise on Aristotle’s Metaphysics” (I:1). If we limit ourselves to the Latin tradition, this claim seems very likely to be true. So although no one could suppose that SMet offers an Aristotelian metaphysics to rival the sophistication of later thirteenth-century figures like Thomas Aquinas and John Duns Scotus, readers who seek to understand the sources of these and other great later figures now have a bedrock text from which to work.
These two volumes provide only the Latin text. The decision not to translate seems reasonable, since SMet is very much a resource for specialists. But although we are given “only” the text, it would be hard to overstate just how rich and careful a work of scholarship this is. The text is established on the basis of all six surviving manuscripts, all varying among themselves significantly and only one of which is complete. We looked hard, but could not find anything at all to complain of—not even the stray typo—in the text they present. And beyond the text itself, the editors have gone to great lengths to situate this work in its historical context, looking both forward and backward. Looking forward, the notes quote at length from figures whom Rufus influenced, especially Adam Buckfield, Albert the Great, and Roger Bacon. (They also quote extensively from parallel passages within Rufus’s own corpus.) Looking backwards, the notes offer generous quotations from Ibn Rushd’s long commentary on the Metaphysics, which serves as Rufus’s main guide to Aristotle’s text. In many cases, the edition is able to offer such generous cross-references because the editors have gone to the astonishing length of preparing working editions of these texts.[1]
Although it is hard to wish for more, when a work runs to 1600 pages, it is notable that the editors do not include the Latin text of the Metaphysics. They could easily have done so, inasmuch as, once again, they went the trouble of preparing a working edition of the translation Rufus used.[2] That translation is certainly worth remarking on, since it is Michael Scot’s Latin translation from an Arabic translation of Aristotle. (What would become the standard scholastic translation, made directly from the Greek by William of Moerbeke, did not appear until later in the thirteenth century.) The text is omitted, no doubt, for understandable reasons of space, but this is a loss. Without having the text of Aristotle at hand, it is hard to know what to think of Rufus’s paraphrase. One wants to know which words are Aristotle’s (twice removed, that is), and which are Rufus’s. This choice to leave the Aristotle out reflects the orientation of the volume. In general, the editors provide incredibly extensive information about how SMet is situated relative to its contemporaries, but offer much less for someone interested in SMet’s relationship to Aristotle. The edition does not even make it easy to use the standard Bekker numbers to cross-reference the commentary with the Aristotelian text.
The Latin text is printed using classical spelling, which is welcome, but in other ways the text is not so reader friendly. The numbering scheme introduced to refer to sections of the text is somewhat obscure, and the editors only rarely insert section headings to guide the reader through the winding path of Rufus’s discussion. Various cryptic editorial abbreviations distract the reader, as do the many intrusive footnote numbers and folio-break indications. The typeset page feels uncomfortably crowded.
These are, however, to use one of Rufus’s favorite words, mere cavillations. The overall project is a triumph of editorial perseverance and scholarly acumen, advancing dramatically our understanding of a hitherto neglected period in the history of European philosophy. Across the many pages of SMet, one finds interesting philosophical ideas aplenty. One of the most notable areas of inquiry is prime matter. Since the editors discuss Rufus’s views here in some detail (I:134–65), we will just briefly note that he describes prime matter as “participated in by everything that has a cause”—that is, everything other than God—“and numerically one in these things” (SMet I:351). Given this picture, one can see why he takes the surprising view that the most basic principle of the science of metaphysics, and so in some sense the subject of metaphysics, just is prime matter (SMet I:239).
A less familiar topic, and a good example of the unexpected gems these volumes contain, is Rufus’s discussion of the grounds of the principle of non-contradiction (PNC). Given the claim, familiar from Metaphysics IV, that PNC is foundational to inquiry, Rufus wonders about why this is the case. After adducing various arguments that suggest we might identify PNC with God, Rufus remarks that PNC holds true both in creatures and in God. So, rather than identify PNC with God, he proceeds to consider why it holds true in God and in creatures (SMet I:503). Among creatures, Rufus claims, PNC is true derivatively, because it is true in God. He then reasons:
This principle [PNC] is true because in the first cause there is no true affirmation and negation concerning the same. And that is true, because in the First there is no being and non-being, because there is no non-being in Him, but being alone and all-at-once. And this is because God is perfect eternity, which is the all-at-once and complete possession of life. In things that have a cause, in contrast, there can be being and non-being, but not at once. (SMet I:504)
The first sentence tells us that PNC holds generally because it holds in God. The second sentence tells us that PNC holds in God because there is never non-being in God. The third sentence then connects this point with Boethian eternality: that God exists all at once, completely possessing all of its being. The very nature of God as eternal thus precludes the possibility of contradictory predicates. PNC is true of God, then, because of God’s nature. And Rufus then suggests that, somehow, the created world inherits this constraint. Obviously, things go from being to non-being, but they are constrained so as not to be both at once. Their temporality marks a departure from the divine, but in retaining the truth of PNC, they retain something of the character of divine eternality. The discussion gives a sense of Rufus’s creativity and depth, and also is characteristic of SMet in its willingness to appeal to Christian sources in its expositions of Aristotelian metaphysics.
Also worthy of note is the treatment of analogy in SMet’s. Following Ibn Rushd (I:470), Rufus holds a view on which analogous terms are related to one another according to prior and posterior meanings. So, two terms are analogous if the meaning of one is derived from the meaning of the other (or if both meanings are derived from some third primary meaning). Rufus’s view is perhaps not so remarkable in itself, inasmuch as it is heavily dependent on the Arabic tradition, and quickly becomes quite common among thirteenth-century Latin authors. But Rufus’s terminology is noteworthy. He uses the word analogia roughly a dozen times to indicate this sort of relationship between prior and posterior meanings. In doing so, he makes frequent reference to the authority of Ibn Rushd, remarking, for instance, that “the Commentator solves this, saying that the multiplicity among those names is not pure equivocation, but analogy” (II:557). In Book IV, and again in Book VII, he invokes Ibn Rushd’s claim that items in the nine accidental categories are called beings only because they are “dispositions of being” and exist in a way derivative of substances (I: 470; II: 62). This again points to the conclusion that ‘being’ is said analogically. And, yet, the Latin translation of Ibn Rushd’s long commentary never uses the term analogia. Indeed, so far as we can determine, there are no known uses of analogia, in this sense, prior to SMet, whereas not long after Rufus’s commentary the term comes to be routinely used in this sense.
Did Rufus invent this famous usage of analogia? We do not know. But, at a minimum, and assuming that the editors are correct in dating SMet to the 1230s, Rufus seems to play a significant role in analogia being adopted as a technical term in logic and theology. In the twelfth century, analogia had a strictly ontological meaning, describing a relationship of participation or proportion between two things. By the 1240s, analogia is used extensively in the Franciscan Summa Halensis, and by the 1250s, analogia makes its way into logic textbooks as a term signifying a relationship of priority and posteriority between two meanings. Rufus is at least an early adopter of this use of the term. Earlier scholars have often repeated the claim that this sense of analogia first appears in the Latin Ibn Rushd, but this seems to be a mistake, based on Latin translations that date from the Renaissance. Here we have an example, then, of how the efforts of Wood, Lewis, and Ottman open up new and fertile directions of inquiry regarding the early development of scholastic philosophy.
Discoveries of this sort are built on historical erudition and hard work, but also on institutional support. In North American universities today, intellectual history is deeply unfashionable, and most philosophers, if they care about history at all, care only about the handful of famous men they themselves studied in school. The idea that historians of philosophy should seek to explore new territory, obvious as that might sound, is in fact barely tolerated. It is important to register, then, that these volumes were possible only because of the support the editors received: from their own academic institutions, from the British Academy and Oxford University Press, who collaborated on the publication, and from the National Endowment for the Humanities, whose funding provided essential support. Fittingly, for a time at which American institutions are under attack from within, the editors dedicate the first of these volumes to the NEH.