While on paper an obvious insider, Raymond Geuss has for decades been criticizing contemporary philosophy as though he were an outsider, viewing it as an intellectually limiting practice too occupied with academically narrow, self-generated problems. He performs this critique with an eye to the past, returning often to canonical or more peripheral figures from the history not only of philosophy but adjacent fields such as literature and classics; accordingly, he aspires to occupy the position of the interdisciplinary critic and interpreter, highlighting exemplary achievements that inspire a more inclusive approach to philosophy.
To be sure, Geuss is also known for his cutting remarks on philosophers and politicians whose judgments depend on a commitment to some unifying principle that, in his view, tends to misrepresent our standing in the world. Moral and political ‘rule-first’ normativists, such as Kant, Rawls, and Habermas, and power politicians prone to speak in the name of pretentious moral ideals, such as Margaret Thatcher and Tony Blair, have been the targets of some rather scathing treatment. If anything, Geuss’s impulse has always been nominalist, prioritizing particulars over generalities, perspectivism over objectivism, and to couch that within an equally decisive measure of realism. Here, the latter means taking real social life and structures into account—“who does what to whom for whose benefit” as Lenin first put it—in contexts that are historically constituted and ultimately recalcitrant to fully transparent mapping and modelling.
Not all that long ago, Richard Rorty promoted similar virtues through a critique of foundationalism and a call for philosophy to become hermeneutic and responsive to a wider range of cultural expressions than what one typically finds in contemporary academic circles. Geuss, for his part, draws on an even wider scope of philosophical sources; and as compared to Rorty—who advocated a sunny version of Deweyan liberal democracy—his political intuitions are much more radically left-wing, inspired by the early Frankfurt School and not seldom verging on the desperate and the aporetic.
Seeing Double is a collection of previously published essays, each of which is exceptionally well written. It analyzes texts and their histories, as well as the views they espouse, displaying to the full Geuss’s formidable imaginative, interpretive, and critical capacities. Like the subject of his first essay, Montaigne, Geuss explores the chosen terrain by contextualizing and discussing the commitments he finds, all the while resisting the categorical, apodictic, and merely deductive register.
Montaigne, as Geuss recounts, was a French aristocrat engaged in the public affairs of his day. In 1571, he withdrew from that life to study and write, effectively inventing the essay (essai, meaning “attempt, trial, experiment”). Montaigne tends to be thought of as a fallibilist and a local skeptic (emerging as a more moderate alternative to Descartes’s global skepticism), alternating between Stoic and Epicurean commitments. Geuss, however, resists the inference to doctrine. The Montaigne he finds useful conducts a conversation with himself aimed at direct acquaintance rather than propositional knowledge. He wants to understand a phenomenon or practice immanently.
As a species of otium, it can be viewed as a leisurely activity and an end in itself, more cognitively akin to coming to know a potential friend than to a philosopher seeking out generality, consistency, theory, justification, and truth. The thinker conducts conversations—which are sometimes messy, crisscrossing wide swaths of terrain for the very sake of doing it—with no aim other than “getting to know” something in the most colloquial, everyday sense. “The essay does not propose solutions to problems; it gives no directives, not even (really) any recommendations…The essay…is a vehicle for exploring the shifting and plural ways of seeing the same thing, which are characteristic of any individual who has not been robotized. It is a medium of self-knowledge” (33).
While textually an attractive approach to Montaigne, one may want to know more about what role the reader is supposed to play in this account. Montaigne converses with himself, and as a result the reader gets to know the author through the way he presents and explores himself in the Essais. Is the reader just an onlooker? In some cases, certainly, but Geuss also suggests that the reader may relate to Montaigne “as he himself related to Cicero, Seneca, and Plutarch, and…engage with him as a companion in imaginary conversation” (26), making it possible to “come to know oneself and becoming a friend to oneself” (ibid.).
If we relate to him the way he related to, for example, Cicero, are we not then reverting to the search for doctrine and determinate truth-claims that Geuss thinks the essay formally contravenes? If engagement with someone like Montaigne’s writing encourages and helps the reader to attain self-knowledge, then how might that happen? Just watching an interesting mind conversing with itself may not achieve that, and why should it? Is it perhaps that the author arrives at expressions capable of claiming some sort of exemplarity—thanks to an ability to speak not only for the author but also for the reader, possibly any reader, inviting something like, yes, friendship? If so, how might their claim to universality be different from the Platonic search for essences from which Geuss so vehemently distinguishes Montaigne’s project?
From Kant’s third Critique to Wittgenstein and Stanley Cavell, the concept of subjective universality has a long and somewhat unacknowledged history in recent Western philosophy. The piece on Montaigne would have been an excellent opportunity for Geuss to investigate this idea. The worry, after all, is that he sets up a false dichotomy. On the one hand, Montaigne just converses with and about himself like any intelligent person might do, in which case, it might seem that the reader is left only with the French writer’s subjective idiosyncrasies, unable to learn anything beyond that. On the other hand, if Montaigne gives the reader some purported truth or account of broader philosophical significance, then he is not the essayist that Geuss thinks he is.
The second essay, on Rabelais, applies Geuss’s interest in perspectival multiplicity to language. Geuss argues that this French Renaissance humanist, in his four-volume Gargantua and Pantagruel, demonstrates the inextricably linguistic nature of human understanding and the need for interpretation when faced with the foreign and unknown. In addition to the grotesque and often satirical distortions (especially of the human body) for which Rabelais has been known—his interest in the low, vernacular, and ridiculously heterogeneous, through which he criticizes medieval scholasticism and lampoons the abuses of princes and popes—there is also an acknowledgement of what it means to be faced with different languages, each in need of understanding and interpretation, with each act of making sense involving a gamble. While Gargantua and Pantagruel was written in Middle French, the text abounds with Greek, Latin, and many other languages, including regional and dialectal terms; and in the creative use of puns, calquing, glossing, and neologisms, Rabelais plays with language, highlighting its endless and perhaps always uncontrollable polysemic nature. The Russian literary critic and philosopher Mikhail Bakhtin famously thought of this as having a root in the “carnivalesque”, a collective humor with medieval origins that celebrates heterogeneity. Similarly, Geuss reads a commitment out of Rabelais to a modernity accepting “a relatively high degree of uncertainty and ambiguity in human affairs” (51).
Geuss thinks of this as a “low road to modernity”, as reflected in the essay’s title. In general terms, what he seems to have in mind is that Rabelais expresses certain ideals—of toleration, obviously, and openness to different interpretations and perspectives—while also exemplifying a set of virtues associated with these ideals. In fact, the ideals (and this is crucial to Geuss, who could otherwise be accused of crypto-normativism) cannot be disconnected from the practice and cultivation of the virtues.
However, the moderns chose otherwise. The modernity we ended up with, according to Geuss, was more reflective of “the single-mindedly wilful ego, relentlessly imposing itself on a potentially flat monolingual world which is thought to need no interpretation, and which is kept in order mainly by the brute force of the Leviathan” (54). Yet is this view, familiar from critics of modernity ranging from Heidegger to Adorno and beyond, really true today? Isn’t our digitally mediated world in fact quite Rabelaisian, a seemingly endless proliferation of images and languages that precisely forces us, for better or worse, to adopt the ironic attitude that Geuss recommends?
The rich third essay on Nietzsche drives home an expanded notion of what it is to philosophize and especially to seek self-knowledge. Rather than searching, perhaps via a Platonic, conversational dialectic, for some fixed essence that simply does not exist, the Nietzschean advice (which Geuss also finds in Herodotus) consists in retracing the messy history of which we are a part and that has led us to where we happen to be. Doing so means that the philosopher must be willing to break down disciplinary walls and be receptive to a host of different fields and activities, including ethnology, rhetoric, literature, and of course, history. Context, in other words, matters more than most philosophers recognize. Attempts to rigorously distinguish the a priori from the a posteriori necessarily falter when faced with the massive ocean currents of history that have made us into the beings we are.
As should be obvious from these brief remarks, Geuss makes a number of recommendations, many of which have a universalist ring to them. This is not intellectual history in a purely descriptive sense. One may worry that this could lead him to violate his own stricture regarding rule-first normativism. However, these recommendations are precisely not made dependent on rule-first norms. Rather, they are shown to be embedded in historically evolving practices that often belong to institutions and are marked by power. While in need of reflection, they are thus meant to attract agents already steeped in traditions and not just found legitimate based on an appeal to ahistorical principles.
Seeing Double also contains exceptionally interesting essays on the senses, on normativity and its role in speech, on the application of notions of success and failure to an entire life, and on the concept of hope. All of them complicate simple yet standard philosophical assumptions, highlighting the plurality of possible perspectives, the implausibility of arriving at some unitary, universally valid point of view or norm, and the importance of paying attention to contexts. Even desire requires “double seeing”: while often contradictory and opaque, it is not necessarily well-represented in individual preference formation, causing problems for the notion of freedom within many versions of liberalism.
Much of this is of course not new. The Anglophone world of philosophy was for a long time dominated by various versions of both naturalism and historicism; also resurfacing for at least half a century was pragmatism, to which Geuss expresses a debt (at least in its Deweyan form). However, Geuss’s view—not only in its rejection of the a priori and the universal but also of systematicity and regimented inference as well—may seem to go further than those approaches in challenging a traditional view of philosophy. In fact, one may even ask whether he is still doing philosophy at all.
Geuss himself may not care all that much about whether he is or isn’t doing philosophy. After all, according to his oft-repeated claim, modern philosophy has often had an unduly and, from a historical point of view, uniquely narrow conception of itself. Examined more broadly, he points out that philosophers have played the roles of priest, lawgiver, prophet, seer, scientist, advisor to princes, writer, political leader, etc. While this is true, one might still want to know how far one can go today without completely losing sight of the idea (even in the fragmented form that most academic philosophers now will have taken for granted) of philosophy as a distinct discipline. Would Geuss welcome the undermining of all such policing of boundaries, whether semantic or institutional? If so, might this approach not come at some cost? Does Geuss see any downside to his mode of thinking?
Geuss’s own essays certainly respond to some fairly classical questions of human life: of what it is to be an agent plagued by questions of what to think and what to do in a world devoid of genuine, pre-given certainties, and of how we may best go about understanding ourselves. Thus, the final essay on hope raises a number of profound questions. While criticizing both the desire to edify among philosophers and, contrastingly, cynicism as a general attitude, it advocates a form of minimalism: hope makes sense when tailored to the things we can realistically get done and achieve. The question then becomes: what possibilities for action are open to us? And this itself may call for social criticism. If reflecting on this issue with the historical sweep and acuity of Geuss’s scholarship does not currently qualify as exemplary philosophy, then it should. The profession needs exactly the sort of discussion to which this terrific book contributes.
ACKNOWLEDGEMENTS
I would like to thank Richard Eldridge, Iain Macdonald, and Fred Rush for comments on an earlier draft of this review.