Skepticism and Fallibilism,

Scepticism is the view that we know almost nothing. Despite its historical pedigree, and its centrality both as a topic of research and as a staple of undergraduate syllabi, this view has few contemporary defenders. Instead, it is primarily evoked in ways that presuppose its falsity, as when epistemologists debate where particular arguments for scepticism go wrong, or object to an otherwise appealing thesis because of its sceptical consequences.

Skepticism and Fallibilism calls for a different approach: we should develop scepticism into a positive theory of what knowledge is, and what we would have to be like to have it. Occasionally, Kvanvig seems to suggest that this may make scepticism more defensible, giving it tools to resist quick dismissal on the grounds that it is too radical and implausible to be taken seriously (27). But the more consistent theme, adapting Stroud (1984), is that developing a positive sceptical theory will reveal insights that non-sceptical theories should aim to integrate.

The book proceeds as follows. Chapter 2 argues that, if scepticism is to be illuminating, we need to do more than formulate sceptical arguments: mainly because, for broadly Moorean reasons, it will always be more plausible to reject one of the premises of such an argument than to accept its conclusion. Chapter 3 argues that we shouldn’t be satisfied with standard non-sceptical theories: they don’t adequately explain the temptation to think that knowledge is incompatible with the possibility of error. Together, these motivate Chapters 4 and 5, which develop a sceptical conception of knowledge, and defend it against a challenge that Kvanvig regards as particularly significant—more on this below. Chapter 6 then develops a non-sceptical conception of knowledge as suitably approximating the state identified by the sceptic’s conception. Chapter 7 concludes with lessons for the importance of epistemic humility.

This review will focus on Chapters 4 and 5, which serve as the book’s fulcrum, and contain some of its most original ideas.

According to Kvanvig, scepticism is driven by infallibilism, the view that knowledge is incompatible with any risk of error. After rejecting alternatives, Chapter 4 proposes to understand infallibility in terms of control, which is itself understood in terms of abilities. While I couldn’t quite find a canonical statement, I take the proposal to be that a belief amounts to knowledge just in case the facts about which powers and abilities were exercised in forming the belief completely explain why the belief is true.^[1] Let us stipulatively refer to such beliefs as i-knowledge; the sceptic/infallibilist’s distinctive claim would then be that knowledge is i-knowledge.

I’m not sure that this really is the right way of articulating a sceptical/infallibilist position, at least if we want a characterization that is neutral on other controversial questions in the area.

Firstly, I worry that i-knowledge may not be enough for knowledge. Perhaps someone could have an infallible perceptual power while having good reasons to doubt that they have such a power (some versions of Bonjour’s (1980) clairvoyant come to mind); if so, it’s tempting to think that their perceptual beliefs aren’t always knowledge, even though they are i-knowledge. Or they could have perfect deductive capacities and working memory, but be uncertain that they do; it’s then tempting to think that the beliefs they form through complex deductive reasoning aren’t knowledge, even though they are i-knowledge. This second version of the concern is closely connected to one of the main challenges to scepticism as a positive position, namely that it becomes unstable or self-undermining once generalized to logical or epistemological domains.^[2] Not discussing it thus feels like a missed opportunity.

Secondly, I worry that beliefs that are intuitively “fallible” could amount to i-knowledge, given certain views about abilities. Earlier in the book, Kvanvig briefly considers non-sceptical views sometimes associated with infallibilism, citing McDowell (1994) and Williamson (2000); he suggests that these views aren’t genuinely infallibilist because “they make no pretence of claiming that our epistemic assurances are maximal” (44). However, an important theme in this tradition is that the mental states and processes involved in the “good cases” of knowledge are not of the same kind as those involved in the “bad cases” of error. It seems a small step from there to thinking that they do not involve the exercise of the same powers or abilities, say because the ability exercised in the good case is an ability to know, and one only genuinely exercises an ability when one does so successfully.^[3] But if bad cases don’t involve the exercise of the same powers or abilities as good cases, then many of our ordinary beliefs qualify as i-knowledge.

But let’s set those worries aside, and return to the main strand. Having articulated an infallibilist conception of knowledge, Kvanvig introduces a challenge for the sceptic/infallibilist that dominates the remainder of these chapters: that of showing that beings recognizably like us could in principle have powers that enable us to have i-knowledge. In fact, he sets an even higher bar: the sceptic/infallibilist should try to show that, for each of the abilities or powers that we ordinarily think of as producing knowledge, there are recognizable idealizations of those abilities or powers that could result in i-knowledge. If this challenge can’t be met, Kvanvig holds, then i-knowledge is too far removed from our ordinary epistemic concepts and practices to illuminate them.

Kvanvig argues that this challenge is relatively straightforward to meet for many of our modes of inquiry, such as perception, deduction, testimony, and rational intuition. (I’m less sure, but won’t press that point here.) However, Kvanvig worries that the challenge initially looks insurmountable in the case of nonmonotonic (or “defeasible”) reasoning, paradigmatically exemplified by inductive beliefs about the future. This is an interesting, and I think important, observation: unlike most of our other trusted methods of belief formation, defeasible inference seems to wear its fallibility on its sleeve. As such, our willingness to use defeasible inference, and to sometimes treat the products of such inferences as knowledge, pose a distinctive challenge to infallibilism.

Chapter 5 aims to address this challenge on behalf of the sceptic/infallibilist. The solution is framed in terms of defeasible reasoning machines that draw out all of the defeasible consequences of a given set of inputs. What makes the consequences defeasible (or nonmonotonic) is that the machine may not draw conclusions from a set of inputs that it would have drawn from a subset of those inputs: e.g., it may not conclude that all ravens are black when the input consists of a hundred black and one white raven, even though it does draw this conclusion when the input consists of only the hundred black ravens. We can then distinguish inputs according to whether they will result in completion, that is, whether a machine given those inputs will take a stance on every question. Kvanvig’s proposed response to his challenge is that, given other assumptions that the sceptic may legitimately help themselves to, one can ensure that defeasible reasoning never introduces error to one’s belief system “by restricting one’s use of defeasible reasoning to contexts where an initial supposition state leads to completion” (141).

Let’s grant, for the sake of argument, that such a restriction would count as a reasonable idealization. That still leaves the question of whether it is enough to guarantee infallibility. On the face of it, the answer seems to be no. Suppose that the world is extremely simple: all it contains are 100 black ravens and one white raven. I have observed only the 100 black ones, and have thus concluded that all ravens, including the one I haven’t yet seen, are black. I have thus reached completion: I take a stance on every question. My input observations, moreover, were unfailingly accurate. And yet my use of defeasible reasoning has introduced error into my belief state.

What, on Kvanvig’s account, prevents this possibility? It seems to be the assumption that “truth leaves tracks”—that for any truth, (fallible) evidence for that truth can be found; this is an assumption that Kvanvig argues that the sceptic may legitimately help themselves to (115-117) and explicitly appeals to in his argument that completion entails infallibility (138-141). But I don’t see how this assumption helps. We can add to my story that I will eventually examine the final raven and discover that it is white, so that no truth remains hidden from me forever—this does not prevent me from using defeasible reasoning to form a complete but mistaken picture of reality before I do.

Where does Kvanvig’s reasoning go wrong? I suspect it is in his argument that when defeasible reasoning results in completion, there can be no “external” defeaters for the resulting beliefs, i.e., no truths that you are unaware of such that, if you became aware of them, you would have to revise one of the beliefs. (In my example above, the final raven being white is such an external defeater.) Kvanvig argues that the “truth leaves tracks” assumption rules out such external defeaters:

Once this assumption is in place, the tracks created would need to be accommodated by the reasoning program, … and thus tracks that defeat would end up being subsumed in the system of information on which the program operates, thereby counting as internal defeaters. (139)

The reasoning seems to be that the external defeater would have left tracks; that these tracks must be available to the program; and that, therefore, any potential defeating force of the external defeater is already accounted for by the program. But why think that the tracks, even if they exist, are available to the program? This seems to illicitly move from the assumption that evidence for a truth can always be found to the much stronger assumption that all reasoning machines have always already found this evidence.^[4] The only fix I can see is to strengthen the idealization, restricting the use of defeasible inference only to contexts where all possible evidence has been obtained. But, at that point, we have surely idealized too far for the result to be anything like our own use of defeasible reasoning.

Overall then, I’m not convinced by the positive theory that Skepticism and Fallibilism develops on behalf of the sceptic. What seems importantly correct, however, is its insistence that developing such a theory as clearly as possible, and exploring how it responds to Kvanvig’s challenge (whether by trying to meet it or by explaining why it is misplaced), would benefit all reasonable epistemologies, sceptical or not.

REFERENCES

BonJour, Laurence (1980). “Externalist Theories of Empirical Knowledge” Midwest Studies in Philosophy, 5: 53–73.

McDowell, John (1994). Mind and World. Cambridge MA: Harvard UP.

Millar, Alan (2019). Knowing by Perceiving. Oxford: Oxford UP.

Rinard, Susanna (2018). “Reasoning One's Way out of Skepticism” in Kevin McCain & Ted Poston, (2018) The Mystery of Skepticism: New Explorations. Boston: Brill. pp. 240-264.

Stroud, Barry (1984) The Significance of Philosophical Skepticism. Oxford: Oxford UP.

Williamson, Timothy (2000). Knowledge and its Limits. Oxford: Oxford UP.

Wright, Crispin (1991). “Scepticism and Dreaming: Imploding the Demon” Mind 100 (1):87-116.

ACKNOWLEDGMENTS

Thanks to Brendan de Kenessey and Joshua Thorpe for helpful comments on an earlier draft.