Brian Epstein’s compact eighty-seven-page Cambridge Element Social Ontology provides an impressive, ecumenical overview of the field of social ontology. Epstein characterizes social ontology as concerned, in the first instance, with addressing the ‘What is X?’ question, with ‘X’ replaced by a term about a social object, kind, category, etc. For example, what is a corporation, what is race, what are group attitudes, what is law? No mere summary, the book’s goal is to provide a general, flexible framework for thinking about social kinds. How are inquiries characteristically structured? How can theories be compared? What are the various goals theorists of the social have (for example, ontological reduction vs. critique and amelioration)? What order can we bring to understanding how theories are constructed, and what aspects of the social world they focus on? In this sense, although highly condensed, it is also an ambitious book.
Epstein introduces three case studies: property, group belief, and race. Each is interestingly different from the others, and so they provide a nice range of examples of objects of social theorizing.
The Element is laid out in seven sections. Section 1 introduces the project. Section 2 lays out a two-part structure of inquiry into the social, which provides the framework for the rest of the book. The two linked inquiries are (1) about social construction, or anchoring, in Epstein’s favored terminology, and (2) about its products, that is, what has been constructed. Epstein applies the framework to property in Section 2. Section 3 introduces the other two examples, group belief and race. Section 4 introduces a type of simple theory about social construction, unanimous agreement, applied to property, race, and group beliefs, to illustrate the kinds of questions and challenges that arise in giving theories of the social.
Section 5 steps back to consider different kinds of theories of social construction, how to build a theory of social construction, and what the demands are on an adequate theory. Section 6 turns to the products of social construction, with special attention to questions about the form of a biconditional definition giving necessary and sufficient conditions, where membership conditions are given in terms of the psychological states of people. Section 7 considers alternative approaches to characterizing the products along two dimensions. First, there are approaches that weaken the requirements discussed in Section 6 (to only sufficient or only necessary conditions) and approaches that strengthen them (by requiring definitions to say in virtue of what something is an instance of the kind or to give grounding conditions or the essence of the kind). Second, there are approaches which expand the resources to be drawn on in defining social kinds to include functions, material conditions, and norms. Section 8 aims to tie the entire discussion together, connecting social construction to their products by discussing approaches to sticking out and what social construction accomplishes.
In this brief review, I focus on the distinction between social construction and its products.
Epstein’s aim is to provide an abstract characterization of social ontological inquiry. Consequently, the overall framework is characterized schematically, with certain terms functioning as placeholders to be filled in differently by different theorists.
Epstein distinguishes between plain kinds, on the one hand, and natural and social kinds on the other. Natural kinds are kinds that metaphysically ‘stick out’—this being a placeholder term. Social kinds then are likewise kinds that metaphysically stick out. Examples are restaurant, race, dollar bill, ownership, etc. Options for interpreting sticking out are: existing, being real, being salient, being natural, being named, being important for this or that explanatory task.
Epstein distinguishes two interpretations of ‘What is X?’ First, what ontologically determines that an object is X? Second, why does (or what makes) X metaphysically stick out? The distinction between these questions is central to how Epstein aims to organize thinking about theorizing about the social. The second question is connected with the topic of social construction. The first with the products of social construction. Different theories which look like they have the same target may in fact be focusing on one or these or the other, Epstein argues.
By ‘social construction’, Epstein has in mind ‘ontological social construction’, defined as follows:
X is socially anchored (i.e., ontologically socially constructed) if and only if X sticks out because (ontologically) of social factors. (17)
This question is (at least prima facie) distinct from the definitional question about how X is socially constituted, which has to do with what determines that an object is X.
X is socially constituted if and only if the real definition of X involves social factors. (18)
The distinction here between social anchoring and social constitution corresponds to the distinction between anchoring and grounding in (Epstein, 2015).
This raises a question about the relation between answers to these two questions. If something is socially constructed, is it socially constituted? If it is socially constructed, is it socially constituted in part by the factors that socially construct it? The latter position Epstein calls conjunctivism. While he has elsewhere argued it is false, he remains officially agnostic in this book (see Epstein 2015, Ch. 9).
What the distinction comes to depends in part on how we interpret ‘sticks out’. The “definition” of being socially constructed gives us a family of concepts, not a single one. So, it is not clear how much unity in social inquiries we achieve with this framework, and the answers to the questions about the relation between the two may vary with the interpretation of ‘sticking out’ as well. Epstein is a pluralist about “the mechanisms of social construction” (38). But it is not altogether clear whether ‘social construction’ is apt for all social kinds.
Interpret ‘sticks out’ as ‘exists’. Take the existence of a kind to mean there are instances of it. Take as an example a toy theory of property Epstein introduces. We suppose a community C agrees to the proposition that a person in C has the right (against others in C) to use a tract of land exclusively as she sees fit if and only if she circumnavigates it and is first to circumnavigate any of it. This agreement “generates” or constructs the (or a) social kind property. While this does not ensure that there are any instances of the kind, it makes provisions for it. To generate the kind, if that means instances of it, we have to add that someone in C circumnavigates a tract of land.
What then is the real definition of the kind, the characterization of the product, as opposed to its social construction? At a first pass, one might say:
[P] A tract of land is property of x in C iff x was first in C to circumnavigate it, etc.
(This defines a relation between the land, x, and the community—not a monadic property.) This brings out the idea that the real definition of a social kind and its social construction might involve different sorts of (though linked) investigations.
An important question arises here connected with Epstein’s discussion of the project of giving real definitions of social kinds (in Section 6). Epstein notes that often definitions are given in the form of biconditionals as in [P] but that these are typically intended to have modal implications. Epstein captures this by prepending ‘Necessarily’. This fails, however, to secure that a definition or analysis is being given. (As noted, Epstein recognizes theorists may require more than necessitated biconditionals.) Ideally, in an analysis, we would state necessary and sufficient conditions in terms of concepts or conditions that we can grasp independently of the defined expression that are also concept giving, in the sense that grasping the definition enables one to grasp the concept defined.
This has implications for conjunctivism. Suppose a “real definition” aims to be concept giving. [P] fails to be a real definition on this view. What’s missing is that it is essential to the concept of property that it is connected with rules which encode the community’s commitments to defer in certain matters to the property owner’s choices about the use of her property. In general, for social categories, which are understood in part in terms of rules adopted in a community for interaction with things that fall in the category, grasp of the concept requires understanding how they are embedded in a system of rules that the community adopts. (Perhaps someone will be tempted to object that a ‘real definition’ gives the real essence, and the concept gives only the nominal essence. But in the case of concepts of things that play functional roles in social transactions, nominal and real essence coincide.)
The concept of property is further illuminated by noting that it is the concept of a type of status function (Searle 1995, p. 41). A status function is a function an object has in a social transaction that it can fulfill only if it is collectively accepted as having it (e.g., a pawn in chess, a ten dollar bill, a senator). Status functions are defined by constitutive rules that specify a function for an object in an essentially intentional collective action type. The specification of the role fails to determine what things in the world play the role. So, for anything to play the role, those participating have to collectively accept (direct their intentions with respect to participation in the relevant types of activities at) the same things for the roles (see Ludwig 2017, Chs. 6-13). The concept of property picks out a relation between an individual and something that plays a role in how a community self-consciously regulates their interactions (in accordance with rules) with that individual and those items. Hence, it is a status function. Given this, the conditions specified in a community for when someone owns something is a general agreement on what to treat as filling the property role.
Because there being instances of status functions depends on our shared intentional activities toward (particular or types of) things so conceived, there is a very straightforward sense in which these kinds are socially constructed.
Now, neither race nor group belief, Epstein’s other two case studies, are, prima facie, status functions. I can’t discuss both here. I focus on group belief. Take there being group belief neutrally to be whatever is required for the truth of belief sentences with subject terms referring to groups that are interpreted non-distributively. What is the contrast between social construction and its product in this case? Again, interpret ‘sticking out’ as existing. Prima facie, group belief could exist without our thinking about it as group belief (or even at all).
To take a simple view, suppose for G to believe that p is for it to be the official position of operative members of G that p. This says what constitutes group belief. What makes it exist? That is, how is it socially constructed? It is not clear what is being asked, for this is not a question about etiology. We have given the concept. The kind exists iff something falls under it. Similarly for the concept of a planet. For any x, x is a planet iffdf x is a celestial body that orbits a star massive enough for its gravity to pull it into a spherical shape and clear its neighboring region of smaller objects. The kind exists if the property specified by the predicate on the right is instantiated. Social construction as definition satisfaction for a social kind does not give us an interesting inquiry separate from analysis of the kind.
The same point can be made about a functionalist take on group belief. Epstein writes that the functionalist account “is a plausible direction for approaching the anchoring of group attitudes” (35). But the existence of group attitudes on this view is just there being some states or other playing functional roles (just as for an individual) in a group. It exists because the defining property is instantiated. Epstein notes that for a legal concept like ‘corporate scienter’ (having to do with the ‘mental state’ of the corporation as revealed in the attitudes of its officers), its contours may be determined by judges for practical considerations. But as soon as we turn to legal categories, we are dealing again with status functions. (A similar point can be made about the use of racial terms in legal contexts.)
All of this suggests that the project of finding a single story about what it is to do social ontology that divides the inquiry into questions about social construction and its products that fits every sort of social kind (or view about them) may be overly ambitious, not because of the difficulty of coming to the right account, but because it has a false presupposition, namely, that the variety of things to which the term ‘social kind’ is applied and the variety of explanatory interests brought to bear on them have in common enough features to admit of an even schematically unified account of what it is to investigate them ontologically.
Nevertheless, this is a terrific contribution to the Element series. It is engagingly written, covers an amazing range of issues, raises important questions and is an expert guide to a complex field of inquiry. Highly recommended.
REFERENCES
Epstein, Brian. 2015. The Ant Trap: Rebuilding the Foundations of the Social Sciences. New York, NY: Oxford University Press.
Ludwig, Kirk. 2017. From Plural to Institutional Agency: Collective Action 2. 2 vols. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Searle, John. 1995. The Construction of Social Reality. New York: Free Press.