Galen Strawson’s Stuff, Quality, Structure: The Whole Go is an ambitious and wide-ranging work in fundamental metaphysics. Its primary goal is to present and defend an “identity metaphysics”, according to which many allegedly fundamental metaphysical distinctions are merely different ways of conceptualizing the same phenomena. There are many different components to Strawson’s identity metaphysics. One important claim is “categorical monism”, which is the view that there is only one fundamental ontological category, e.g., there is no real distinction between an object and the properties that it has. Another important claim is the so-called “powerful qualities” view, according to which there is no real distinction between the categorical properties of a thing and the corresponding causal powers (or dispositions) of a thing.
Relatedly, according to Strawson, it is a mistake to separate the laws of nature that govern the physical world from the physical world itself: the physical world could not have been governed by different laws, and information about laws is nothing more than information about the nature of the physical world. Strawson furthermore favors combining his identity metaphysics with two monistic theses: “thing monism” (there is only one fundamental entity in reality) and “kind” monism (there is only one fundamental kind of stuff in reality, where a prominent opposing view is the dualistic view that material things and mental things are fundamentally different in kind). Strawson’s concluding chapter tentatively defends the view that it is necessary that a complete “structural” description of the world uniquely fixes a complete “non-structural” description of the world.
As the reader might have guessed, the views that Strawson defends in the book are far apart from mainstream views in contemporary analytic metaphysics. Moreover, it is worth mentioning that the style of the book is also distinctive. For one, the focus of the book is on developing a unified “big picture” view of fundamental matters in metaphysics, so one might find less detailed argument and critical engagement with alternative views in this book than in other contemporary books in metaphysics, e.g., one could easily write an entire book on categorical monism, or on the powerful qualities view, or on thing-monism, or on kind-monism). The book also seamlessly incorporates references to the history of philosophy throughout. Although Strawson knows full well that his views are not very popular in contemporary metaphysics, he argues that many of his views have been endorsed by some of the most prominent philosophers throughout history (including Descartes, Spinoza, Leibniz, Kant, Schopenhauer, Nietzsche, Whitehead, Russell, and others).
In my view, Strawson does an excellent job of bringing out the intuitive motivations for the views that he discusses in an accessible manner, and I strongly recommend the book to anyone who is interested in fundamental metaphysics. In what follows, I will focus on two of Strawson’s main claims: categorical monism and the powerful qualities view.
A central component of Strawson’s categorical monism is that any object is identical to the properties that it has. More specifically, Strawson defines the “qualities” that an object has as its intrinsic categorical properties, and his claim is that any object is identical to its “total (intrinsic) qualitiedness”. One motivation he gives for this view is negative: if one separates an object from its qualities, one falls into the (alleged) incoherence of “bare particulars”, and if one thinks of properties as constituents of an object, one falls into the standard problems of the “bundle theory”. In addition, even though the view conflicts with ordinary language, Strawson argues that his object-property identity claim is, in some sense, a deeply intuitive claim that is built into ordinary thought. He writes:
the best thing to do, I think, the most truly philosophical thing, is just to look at an everyday object for a while. I’m doing it now. I’m looking at a chair, a wooden chair. What does one get? One certainly doesn’t get the object, on the one hand, and its qualitiedness, on the other hand. Thought in linguistic dress may seem to deliver a hard metaphysical object/quality cut of this sort if one lets it flash into or across the experience one is having (one’s thought may then be dusted with philosophy, or not). But the cut fades away—I submit—if one just looks at the object. For then—I submit—one can’t get the actual being of the thing in the present moment apart from its qualitiedness in any way at all. I think ordinary thought is quite clear on the point, in spite of the fact that it largely lives in language. (77)
While I am sympathetic with the intuition that Strawson is expressing here, I’m not sure how widely-shared this intuition will be.
Strawson’s object-property identity claim naturally raises many objections. Here, I’ll only mention two. One objection, which Strawson considers and responds to, is that the view seems to face temporal and modal counterexamples. Let o be an object and q be its total qualitiedness. Temporally, it seems that a particular object o can persist through time despite changing its total qualitiedness from q to q*. However, if o = q and q ≠ q*, then it’s unclear how o could persist through this change. Modally, we can imagine that o could have had some other qualities q*, but again if o = q and q ≠ q*, it’s unclear how this could be. Strawson’s reply to this objection is that such temporal and modal examples “simply illustrate certain features of our everyday way of thinking and talking of portions of stuff conceived of as particulars” (68). If I’m interpreting Strawson correctly here, then this kind of response is reminiscent of the kind of views defended by temporal and modal counterpart theorists: our judgements involving temporal persistence and de re modality are not really tracking the genuine numerical identity of objects across time and worlds, but rather, they are merely tracking contextually salient similarity relations between objects across times and worlds. Depending on one’s background commitments, one might consider this to be a pretty serious objection.
Another natural objection, which Strawson briefly mentions (but does not respond to) in a footnote, is that his object-property identity thesis implies a highly controversial version of the Principle of the Identity of Indiscernibles (PII), according to which no two objects can have the very same intrinsic qualities. After all, if o1 and o2 both have a total qualitiedness of q, then if o1 = q and o2 = q, then it seems like o1 = o2. However, such a strong version of the PII seems to face both conceivable (e.g. a world with two duplicate particles) and perhaps even actual counterexamples. I would have liked to hear why Strawson thinks that his view doesn’t imply the PII (perhaps because “total qualitiedness” should be conceived of as analogous to how “tropes” are conceived, in that total qualities may be numerically distinct despite being exactly alike?). However, it’s worth noting that it’s unclear whether the PII is a real problem for Strawson’s views, given that he already accepts thing-monism. As has been pointed out before, e.g., Builes (2021), thing-monism allows one to trivially avoid any counterexamples to the PII, while at the same time accommodating the alleged counterexamples to the PII in a monistic framework, e.g., a world with nothing but two duplicate spheres should be re-interpreted as a single universe with a certain symmetric distributional property.
Let us now turn to the powerful qualities view. Here, there are a number of possible contrasting views that one might have. First, one might have a “Humean” view, according to which there are no necessary connections at all in nature (a view that Strawson has argued at length is not actually David Hume’s view). Strawson adamantly rejects such a view, which he thinks implies that “the ordered nature of the universe is a colossal fluke—like a true random number generator producing the natural numbers in perfect order for ever. That’s silly… It’s an insult to Hume—an extraordinary insult—to suppose that he ever thought anything like this” (94).
Alternatively, one could think that physical things are governed by external laws of nature, so that the very same physical things could behave differently if they were governed by different laws of nature. Here, Strawson says that “The position is fantastic; its deep roots seem theological (‘government’). It’s fantastic to pile laws—entirely redundantly—on top of the nature of stuff” (98). In other words, the relevant notion of government seems mysterious, and positing additional laws is unparsimonious when we can appeal to the natures of things to explain why they behave in the way that they do. Instead, Strawson appeals to the causal powers of things to explain why they behave in the way that they do. However, once one believes in powers, a number of questions immediately arise. Does every power have a categorical property as a basis? What is the relationship between a power and its categorical base? According to Strawson, the relationship between a power property and its corresponding categorical property is that of identity.
In order to assess this identity claim, I would have liked to see a clean definition of a “categorical” property and a “power” property. Because these technical terms are defined in different ways, there is a real worry of philosophers talking past each other. For example, in arguing that causal powers are categorical properties, Strawson says:
To possess potency or power is, trivially, actually to possess it, to be in an actual persisting state that constitutes possessing it. It is in other words to possess a certain categorical property. The power property is a categorical property. (83)
Unfortunately, I don’t expect this to be very convincing. In order for the thesis that powers are categorical to be interesting, it needs to be non-trivial, but the above quote threatens to render the thesis trivial. I’m not sure whether any powers theorist would deny that power properties are properties that are actually possessed, even though most powers theorists would deny that power properties are categorical properties.
Another worry for the identity claim, which Strawson discusses, is that there seems to be an asymmetric explanatory connection between a power and its corresponding categorical base. For example, take the (categorical) property of being spherical and the (power) property of being able to roll. Intuitively, something is able to roll because it is spherical, but it’s not the case that something is spherical because it is able to roll. Strawson admits that it is natural to think in these asymmetric terms, but he nevertheless thinks that these intuitions should not drive us to reject the identity claim. According to Strawson, this asymmetric explanation
springs into natural application as soon as we draw conceptual lines that separate the category of power from the category of intrinsic qualitiedness. But there is, so to say, no real ontic grounding here, only identity. (83)
Because I am more naturally inclined towards a view where the powers of a thing are distinct from, and explained by, their categorical properties, I would have liked to hear more about what separates Strawson’s view from this closely related view (which I suspect might turn on how the notions of “categorical property” and “power property” are being understood).
Let me close by saying that I greatly enjoyed reading this book. It is relatively short, accessible, big picture, and full of insightful discussions of important foundational matters in metaphysics. I hope it is widely read.
REFERENCES
Builes, David. 2021. “The World Just Is The Way It Is”. The Monist 104, no. 1: 1-27.