Susan Stebbing (1885-1943) was a prominent analytic philosopher in the generation after Russell and Moore. Stebbing was highly influential on the post-war generation of analytic philosophers, but her work suffered unwarranted neglect toward the end of the last century. Stebbing is best known for her work on three themes. First, she examined and critiqued various notions of analysis. Second, Stebbing developed a philosophy of science that engaged with working physicists, including their more philosophical writings addressed to the wider public. Third, Stebbing wrote about critical thinking for non-academic audiences. Towards the end of her life, Stebbing also wrote about moral and political philosophy. Some of Stebbing’s contemporaries held a high opinion of this work, though it is less well-known today. For example, in reviewing Ideals and Illusions (1941), C. D. Broad says:
If I were teaching ethics in a university I should make my students close all their textbooks and read and discuss Professor Stebbing's new book. (1941, 117)
In recent years, there has been a renewed interest in Stebbing’s work, including a growing secondary literature. Some of Stebbing’s books, such as Thinking to Some Purpose, have been reprinted. However, these books often focus on a single facet of Stebbing’s thought. It can be difficult to find a more comprehensive presentation of Stebbing’s thinking in her own words.
Therefore, we are fortunate to have this recent volume of Stebbing's papers, edited and with an introduction by Siobhan Chapman. The volume admirably serves to introduce Stebbing’s thought but also contains material of interest to those already working in the field. The volume is divided by topic, corresponding to major topics of Stebbing’s work: Logic, Science, Analysis, and the more heterogeneous category Ideology.
The section on Logic develops topics that Stebbing also addresses in A Modern Introduction to Logic. One early work, “A Reply to Some Charges Against Logic” (1915, Chapter 1) examines Charles Arthur Mercier’s claim that (in Stebbing’s phrasing) “logicians do not use the forms which they say are the only possible modes of reasoning” (3). The charge specifically is that when arguments are offered in ordinary life, they are not explicitly formulated as formal syllogisms. Stebbing considers examples of reasoning such as the following:
If The bed contains nothing but geraniums and violas,
then It contains no asters. (4)
This argument clearly does not obey the rules of formal syllogisms, which require two premises. Stebbing responds by showing that the arguments stated in natural language can be re-expressed in ways that make the syllogistic structure explicit. In the case at hand, Stebbing suggests that the argument is elliptical. The structure of a formal argument, for Stebbing, is not a prediction about how the argument will be expressed, but figures in distinguishing valid reasoning from invalid reasoning (8). In addition to contributing to Stebbing’s philosophy of logic, this paper is concerned with the application of logic to science and to ordinary life. In this respect, the paper develops themes that are relevant to Stebbing’s later work.
The section on Analysis includes some important classics discussing different types of analysis, such as "The Method of Analysis and Metaphysics" (1932, Chapter 8) and "Logical Positivism and Analysis" (1933, Chapter 9). Crucial background for these more famous works on analysis is provided by other papers, including “Logical Constructions and Knowledge through Description” (1931, Chapter 2) and “Substances, Events, and Facts” (1932, Chapter 7).
In these chapters, I found Chapman’s editorial interventions most helpful. Stebbing sometimes includes long quotations in untranslated German or ancient Greek (161), with sources that are not always easy for the contemporary reader to identify. Chapman identifies a modern edition as a source for the quotation and provides a published translation in the footnotes. This is especially helpful in understanding Stebbing’s discussion of important but less well-known figures such as Waismann.
The volume includes papers serving as introductions to Stebbing’s work on critical thinking and the philosophy of science. “Thinking” (1936, Chapter 13) can serve as an introduction to issues that Stebbing expands in Thinking to Some Purpose. “Nebulous Philosophy—Jeans and Eddington” (1937, Chapter 5) introduces themes discussed at length in Philosophy and the Physicists. In these respects, the volume is suitable for those with little prior knowledge of Stebbing's philosophy and can serve as an introduction to her views on a wide range of topics.
What I find particularly valuable about this volume, however, are the papers that simultaneously develop multiple themes from her work, showing that Stebbing's interest in logic, in critical thinking, in philosophy of science, or in ethics are interrelated. I will consider two examples.
In “The Creed of a Dialectical Materialist” (1938, Chapter 14), Stebbing reviews H. Levy’s book, A Philosophy for a Modern Man. Like Stebbing, Levy criticizes the efforts of scientists who attempt to apply their results to philosophy. The review notes their similar reaction to the physicist Sir Arthur Eddington’s claim that discoveries of modern science show that ordinary objects such as a writing table are not solid. According to Eddington, the table is not solid because the particles posited by the physicist to explain its behavior are far apart relative to their size. Stebbing and Levy each agree that this talk arises from confusion of levels of description. For Levy, the description “solid” can only apply to the behavior of a group of particles: “as a group they manifest solidity” (1938, 32). Stebbing approvingly cites such statements but criticizes Levy for making other claims that seem to cross levels, such as “the word mind simply serves to group together a series of aspects of the composite activity we call thinking” (189, quoting Levy, 1938, 30). For Stebbing, the claim that the word ‘mind’ refers to a series of events of thinking illicitly confuses levels as much as Eddington’s claim.
Levy’s theory of levels is framed in terms of the relation between “isolates” and groups of isolates. Levy contrasts the way in which sciences often progress by “isolating” or focussing on certain features of a situation to make predictions. However, predications can often only be made by thinking about an isolate in relation to its environment. Levy gives the example of a family as an isolate in social science. The family has its own internal structure. But, social science predictions will depend on the isolated family’s relation to the social conditions in which they are embedded. Sometimes, the predictions require appealing not to an individual isolate, but to a group of isolates (Levy 1938, 142). This is where the distinction of levels arises for Levy. A predicate such as ‘solid’ applies on the basis of the behavior of a group of isolates rather than an individual isolate.
Stebbing turns Levy’s distinction of levels against some of the more grandiose statements of his scientific socialism. For example, Levy wants to emphasize the role of human beings in the unfolding of history. He frames this both in terms of ‘man’, the abstract noun referring to roughly humankind, and ‘men’, the individual isolates of humankind. When Levy says that ‘Man is himself part of the historical process’ (186, quoting Levy, 1938, 127), Stebbing finds it unclear whether he is referring to individual human beings or to the kind. Insofar as playing this part requires action that aims to achieve some ideal, Stebbing worries that it presupposes that there is some single human ideal towards which all human beings are oriented.
[Levy] has failed to notice the enormous assumption he has made in asserting that a philosophy must illuminate the part man has to play in re-shaping the world so that man’s ideals may finally be achieved. The assumption is that you, I, he, they (whoever they may be) have the same ideals. If this were so, vice would indeed be ignorance and the difference between Hitler and Stalin, or between Hitler and Niemöller a difference in what they happen to respectively know. (186)
This theme, that different people endorse conflicting ideals, is developed at length by Stebbing in her political philosophy in Ideals and Illusions. Stebbing believes that the fact that there is not one set of universally agreed upon ideals or goals has been neglected by political philosophers. Explaining why many philosophers, politicians, and ordinary people adopt ideals which she finds abhorrent constituted a problem. It is interesting to see it developed in terms of the theory of isolates in the context of her review of Levy.
In closing her review (189-90), Stebbing says that Levy’s theory of “isolates” is the part of the book she finds most interesting. This attitude is reflected in the fact that Stebbing herself puts the notion of an isolate to work in investigating the status of moral rules. In “Men and Moral Principles”, Stebbing argues that apparent moral generalizations such as ‘tell the truth’ are plausible only when the act of lying is considered in isolation. In a broader context, as when the lie is essential to protecting a life, the generalization does not hold. Stebbing says:
Now the rule is an isolate: Speak the truth—just that and nothing more…By making an isolate we obtain the rule; in thus isolating we abstract from circumstances in the situation that alone make it a duty to speak the truth… (1943, 16)
For Stebbing, it may be a rule to speak the truth. However, this does not tell us in any particular case whether we should speak the truth. For almost any rule, there are circumstances in which it should be disregarded. And, even in circumstances in which we should speak the truth, it is not because it is true. Thus, in this one review, we see themes developed in Stebbing’s philosophy of physics, in her political philosophy, and in her moral theory.
Multiple themes in Stebbing’s thought arise again in another work, “Materialism in the Light of Modern Scientific Thought” (1928, Chapter 4). Stebbing contrasts L. J. Russell’s claim that scientific materialism appears to exclude secondary qualities such as colours, shapes, textures, and smells from nature with Whitehead’s claim that scientific materialism appears to exclude values and purposes. Stebbing evinces a different reaction to these two claims.
I am myself in complete agreement with Whitehead’s insistence that colours, sounds, scents, etc., must be included in nature and that their exclusion leads to a vicious bifurcation. But in his later expositions of this doctrine Professor Whitehead seems to me quite unwarrantably to stress the notion of value, vaguely conceived, and suggesting even the reintroduction of purpose into the scientific scheme. (33)
The juxtaposition of these two issues is interesting because Stebbing separately pursues the issue of relation of secondary qualities to scientific theory in Philosophy and the Physicists (60-64) and the relation of values to scientific theory in “Men and Moral Principles”.
Overall, then, this volume is a welcome contribution. It provides a single resource serving as a first introduction to a wide range of Stebbing’s work. Chapman’s introduction helps orient the new reader. Yet, the volume also has significant value for those already familiar with Stebbing’s work.
REFERENCES
Broad, C. D. (1941). Review of Ideals and Illusions. Ethics: 52:1: 117-118. (Attributed to C. D. B.)
Levy, H (1938). A Philosophy for a Modern Man. London: Victor Gonzales, LTD.
Stebbing, L. Susan (1930/1948), A Modern Introduction to Logic. London: Methuen & Co.
Stebbing, L. Susan (1937/2018), Philosophy and the Physicists. New York, NY: Routledge.
Stebbing, L. Susan (1939/1941). Thinking to Some Purpose. New York, NY: Allen Lane: Penguin Books.
Stebbing, L. Susan (1941/1948). Ideals and Illusions. London: Watts & Co.
Stebbing, Lizzie Susan (1944). Men and moral principles. L. T. Hobhouse Memorial Lectures, No. 13. London: Oxford University Press.