In this short, but wide ranging and readable book, Matthew Tugby addresses teleology and the related notions of function and goal-directedness. He commences by contrasting Nagel’s reductionist approach to teleology with Aristotle’s acceptance of irreducibly teleological properties in the world. Associated with the latter camp, says Tugby, are modern power theorists, whose view of the fundamental natures of properties is teleological.
The second section provides a very nice survey of the major views of function and their problems. The broad outline of this section is that etiological/selectionist accounts of function characterize an important subclass of functions, but not all functions. On the other hand, the causal role approach of Robert Cummins (1975) and others tends to be over-inclusive. Better than both is the goal-directedness theory of function, which, in effect, adds to the causal theory the requirement that a function contributes to the overall goal of a system. This restricts the extension of function relative to the causal role theory, while being more inclusive than the etiological theory, since on the face of it, it allows for functions that haven’t been selected for. Tugby argues that the goal-directedness theory has a flexibility that allows it to accommodate recent theories of function (of which he gives a very useful survey).
Whether the goal-directedness theory provides a satisfactory account of teleology depends to a large extent on what we can say about goals. Goals, then, are the topic of the third section of Teleology. This chapter focuses primarily on the claims and then the weaknesses of the cybernetic approach of Thomas Nagel (1979) and Christopher Boorse (1976). The latter takes a structure to be a system with a goal if it responds to environmental changes so as to achieve (or maintain) a given state. Tugby raises various challenges to the cybernetic approach, in particular the objection that this approach cannot distinguish between a structure that has goal G but which fails to achieve that goal and a structure that does not have that goal at all. Tugby concludes that reductionism about teleology faces considerable, perhaps insuperable problems, and that we should consider realism about teleology—that is, that there is irreducible goal-directedness in the world.
In the final section Tugby introduces the metaphysics of powers, since this is where we can locate irreducible goal-directedness. Powers are properties that have a dispositional character, where this character is essential to the property. And ‘property’ here is understood in a metaphysically heavyweight, ontic sense. A power is, therefore, necessarily related to a possible manifestation. And so it necessarily has a directedness about it. Tugby is well known for his forceful defence of a carefully developed, Platonic version of this view in Putting Properties First (2022). Here he is more interested in how this view can be put to work in providing solutions to the problems outlined above. Tugby rightly rejects George Molnar’s (2003) intentionality theory of powers’ directedness, preferring to draw on and develop Nick Kroll’s (2017) view of dispositions as inherently teleological. That view takes dispositions and so powers to be necessarily end-directed. Tugby maintains that this is not sufficient for goal-directedness. For goal-directedness also requires the kind of complexity that the cybernetic approach is concerned with, in particular the plasticity and environmental responsiveness that allows a system to maintain a direction. Powers enable Tugby to answer the problems facing the reductive views considered earlier. For example, powers can be directed towards an outcome yet not manifest that outcome thanks to the interference of finks or masks/antidotes.
Tugby’s book is an excellent introduction to the principal theories and problems surrounding functions, goal-directedness and the like. Being very well researched, this is more than an introduction, bringing the reader up to date with how debates and ideas have progressed. And it is also more than an introduction in the way that Tugby brings to bear his own answer to these problems, giving the volume a satisfyingly rounded, broadly Aristotelian, view of these matters.
I shall conclude by airing my reservations about Tugby’s own answer, although such criticisms do not detract from the excellence of this book.
The key difference between the metaphysics of powers and the ‘semi-Humean’ natural necessitation view of David Armstrong (1983) and others is modal. Where a powers theorist sees a power, the opponent sees a non-power property plus a law of nature. Think of the Earth attracting the Moon gravitationally. The Armstrongian holds that the attraction results from the property of gravitational mass plus the law of universal gravitation, where that law is a relation of contingent necessitation between universals. The former, the powers theorist, holds that two objects attract one another in virtue of their property of gravitational mass alone. The law (or what we take to be a law) is the result of the power, gravitational mass, doing its thing. (We are here pretending that Newton gives a correct scientific account.) As far as the actual world is concerned, what the one explains, the other can explain also. The difference emerges when we move to other possible worlds. For the non-powers theorist holds that there can be other possible worlds where there is the very same property, which we call ‘gravitational mass’. In some of these non-actual worlds, gravitational mass does not result in mutual attraction but in some other behaviour because the laws are different there. The powers theorist says that this is impossible, since, as discussed, the laws are reflections of the natures of the properties. So the advantages (or disadvantages) of the powers metaphysic will reveal themselves in modal contexts. But I don’t see this at play in Tugby’s discussion. So the non-powers theorist could retort:
I agree with everything you say except the very last bit, where you say that resolving the problems of teleology using powers shows that we have a strongly non-reductive account of teleology, resting a metaphysics of intrinsically teleological properties. For I think that your powers can be reduced to non-teleological (‘categorical’) properties plus the laws of nature. The latter can explain everything in the actual world that your theory explains.
From that perspective we haven’t really resolved the question of whether there is irreducible teleology or end-directedness in the world. Another way of putting this might be to ask whether, if powers are end-directed, are Armstrongian relations of natural necessitation among universals not then also end-directed, for they too point from one entity (universal) to another, where the first thereby brings about the second?
I wonder, therefore, whether the puzzle of big ‘T’ ‘Teleology’ as Tugby calls it (i.e., irreducible teleology) is located in the right place, if the directedness of powers is seen to be a plausible solution. To my mind it is the intentionality of (some) teleology that is the real puzzle. That is, teleology is potentially mysterious when it involves a representation of a goal that directs what an object does. An irreducible intentionalistic teleology in the world (beyond the minds of humans and other thinkers) would be puzzling. How could the heart direct itself to pumping blood in the way that I direct myself to writing this review? Presumably the heart does not do this, it does not represent the pumping of blood to itself in the way that I represent the writing of the review to myself. Tugby does consider that version of the cybernetic approach that also requires a representation of the goal state (e.g., Adams 1979). One reason for rejecting this view is that it fails to accommodate goal-directed systems such as thermostats. But it is unclear that thermostats are intrinsically goal-directed, even though they do represent their goals. A simple thermostat has a dial with numbers that represent the temperature its operator desires. Plausibly it represents that goal in virtue of the intentions of the designers and users of the thermostat. An intrinsically identical object that came into existence entirely by accident (a ‘swamp-thermostat’) would presumably not be a thermostat, unless someone found that they could use it as a thermostat and used it as such.
For related reasons I am not sure that the fact that dispositions and powers may suffer from interference explains all the cases of goal failure. Consider a thermostat where the printing around the dial has (unknown to its user) slipped so that when the dial’s pointer is aligned with the numeral ‘20’, the thermostat heats the room to 18°C (and so on for other temperatures). Another thermostat of the same design but where the numbers are correctly aligned will have exactly the same powers and dispositions. The two thermostats will be alike in terms of what they actually do (and would or could do). When the first is set to 20 it causes the room to be heated to 18°C and the second is set to 18 it also causes the room to be heated to 18°C. But the first is failing to achieve the goal (namely heating the room to 20°C) whereas the second does achieve its goal.
Although I am not yet convinced of this book’s positive proposal, I found it a stimulating idea and thoughtfully argued for. And throughout reading the book I learned a great deal. Thoroughly recommended for those who want to get up to the cutting edge of thought on these topics.
REFERENCES
Adams, F. R. (1979). A goal-state theory of function attributions. Canadian Journal of Philosophy 9: 492–518.
Armstrong, D. M. (1983). What is a Law of Nature? Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Boorse, C. (1976). Wright on functions. Philosophical Review 85: 70–86.
Cummins, R. (1975). Functional analysis. Journal of Philosophy 72: 741–765.
Kroll, N. (2017). Teleological dispositions. Oxford Studies in Metaphysics 10: 1–37.
Molnar, G. (2003). Powers: A Study in Metaphysics. S. Mumford (Ed.). Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Nagel, E. (1979). Teleology Revisited and Other Essays in the Philosophy and History of Science. New York: Columbia University Press.
Tugby, M. (2022). Putting Properties First: A Platonic Metaphysics for Natural Modality. Oxford: Oxford University Press.