The Case for Contextualism: Knowledge, Skepticism, and Context, Vol. 1

Sometimes, speakers use the word ‘know’ rather liberally, happily asserting that subjects ‘know’ propositions on the basis of rather commonplace evidence. But as anyone who has spent some time studying epistemology has seen, it is not difficult to get into a conversational situation in which one is more demanding about ‘knowledge’ attributions; when we are thinking about skeptical possibilities, or emphasizing the importance of getting things right, we sometimes assert that those very same subjects ‘do not know’ those very same propositions.

According to contextualism about ‘knows’, in some of these sorts of cases, both apparently conflicting utterances are true; they are not, as their surface grammar might suggest, negations of one another. The word ‘know’, according to contextualism, is context-sensitive; its semantic value depends in part on the conversational context of the person making the utterance. Contextualism was articulated and defended in the 1990s as both plausible and useful for solving various epistemological problems — notable defenses were given by Keith DeRose, Stewart Cohen, and David Lewis.

There is now a standard corpus of objections to contextualism; among them, that contextualism implausibly makes knowledge depend on non-epistemic factors like stakes or conversational salience; that contextualism cannot make sense of apparent disagreement about knowledge; and, perhaps most influentially, that contextualism posits a problematic form of ‘semantic blindness’. In The Case for Contextualism, Keith DeRose, one of the prominent originators of the contextualist approach to knowledge, summarizes the pressures in favor of contextualism — emphasizing the ‘ordinary language basis’ for contextualism — and argues carefully and forcefully that none of the canonical objections provides strong reasons to reject contextualism. Against the charge that contextualism makes knowledge depend on implausible factors, DeRose (ch. 6) carefully and clearly distinguishes object-level use of the word ‘knows’ with metasemantic mention of it, and plausibly concludes that contextualists are not committed to, e.g., the claim that consideration of questions destroys knowledge. This chapter also includes a forceful critique of David Lewis’s misdescriptions of his own view in “Elusive Knowledge”. Against the charge that contextualists cannot deliver plausible verdicts of disagreement about knowledge, DeRose (ch. 4) develops a “Single Scoreboard Semantics” — an interpretation of contextualism that respects intuitions that in most ordinary conversations, apparent disagreements about knowledge are genuine cases of inconsistent assertions. DeRose’s strategy here is novel and bold — he posits truth-value gaps in many cases of prima facie difficulty for the contextualist. The strategy is worthy of further recognition and consideration. Against the charge that contextualists face a devastating objection from semantic blindness, DeRose (ch. 5) demonstrates that all views about knowledge will have to posit some such feature, and argues on this basis that contextualism is not obviously worse off in this respect than are its rivals. DeRose’s claims here strike me as both plausible and important; to conclude that contextualism is obviously seriously problematic for these simple reasons is a mistake — and a mistake often made. The book succeeds in establishing that contextualism has many resources to respond to canonical objections, and ought still to be considered a view in serious contention for widespread acceptance.

The book is the first of an intended two-part series, Knowledge, Skepticism, and Context; at several points in this volume, DeRose defers discussion of skepticism to the future Volume 2. This, presumably, will develop the ideas in DeRose’s 1995 paper, “Solving the Skeptical Problem”. It is worth being reminded, as DeRose does a few times in the present volume, that it is not his considered view that the skeptic standardly speaks truly.

The Case for Contextualism is nominally a unified monograph, but readers familiar with DeRose’s previously published work on contextualism will recognize a significant majority of the content from previous papers; indeed, five of the six chapters after the introduction take their titles directly from extant papers, and include approximately the same contents with approximately the same structures. However, unifying clarificatory remarks have been added, with appropriate cross-chapter references, so readers new to DeRose’s work will find a unified treatment both accessible and helpful. Although it contains some new material, the primary value I find in this book lies in the way that it clarifies and unifies DeRose’s previous work. This volume will be of particular benefit to graduate students and researchers looking to gain initial sympathetic familiarity with contextualism; it is also clear and accessible enough to be suitable for advanced undergraduates. This book will be among the first resources I turn to when students ask for an introduction to ‘knows’ contextualism.

One exception to the generally well-unified character of the book, in my opinion, lies in DeRose’s treatment of the knowledge norm of assertion. This material lies centrally with respect to two important topics in the book: the positive case for contextualism, and the comparison of contextualism with subject-sensitive invariantism. Therefore, it is, I think, worth discussing in some small detail.

Chapter 3, “Assertion, Knowledge, and Context”, takes most of its content from DeRose’s 2002 paper of the same name. In the paper, DeRose argued that the knowledge norm of assertion provides an argument in favor of contextualism. The argument was approximately this: (1) knowledge is the epistemic norm of assertion; (2) what one is epistemically permitted to assert depends on context; therefore (3) ‘knows’ is context-sensitive. As has since been recognized, however, this argument is doubly equivocal. In moving from (1) to (3), it conflates knowledge-the-mental-state with ‘knowledge’ the word of English. In taking (2) to bear on contextualism, it also conflates, conversational contexts with practical situations: the plausible version of (2) says merely that what one may assert depends in part on one’s situation, but no invariantist does or need deny this obvious truth, regardless of his view about assertion. (We all agree that what one knows depends in part on one’s situation.) As John Hawthorne in particular (in Knowledge and Lotteries) has emphasized, far from putting pressure in favor of contextualism, the knowledge norm of assertion in fact sits in prima facie tension with contextualism, and is most naturally understood as motivating a kind of ‘subject-sensitive’ invariantism: what one may assert depends in part on one’s practical situation; therefore, what one knows depends in part on one’s practical situation. (For a similar argument, see Timothy Williamson’s “Knowledge, Context, and the Agent’s Point of View”.)

DeRose is aware of this objection to his former view, and he includes two pages of new material in response to it. In effect, he weakens the conclusion of the argument to the conditional one that if sensitive invariantism can be ruled out, then the knowledge norm of assertion provides an argument for contextualism over classical invariantism; he takes himself to refute such sensitive views in the final chapters of the book. He also states his version of the knowledge norm of assertion more precisely in a way that renders it consistent with contextualism. These patches, in my opinion, are unsatisfying, for at least three reasons. My first complaint is presentational; because he structures his book so closely around these individual papers, tightly connected points about the normative role of knowledge and sensitive invariantism are spread throughout the book, making for a less cohesive treatment of this central issue. A second, more substantive worry, is that if, as Hawthorne in particular has argued, the relevant kinds of sensitive invariantism are uniquely able to account for knowledge norms and situation-sensitivity of the normative facts, it may well be that the appropriate response to rejecting sensitive invariantism is to reject the relevant knowledge norms; it is therefore not obviously legitimate to bracket sensitive invariantism, rely on the knowledge norm to refute classical invariantism, then return later to argue against sensitive invariantism on independent grounds. My third concern relates to the details of DeRose’s treatment of the knowledge norm of assertion. His version of the knowledge norm of assertion has it that a subject’s assertion that p is epistemically appropriate just in case ‘S knows p’ is true in S‘s context — not necessarily that of the judge who is considering whether S speaks aptly. On this view, there will be many true sentences of the form "S knows p but isn’t in a good enough epistemic position to assert it" and “S is in a good enough epistemic position to assert that p, but doesn’t know it.” These will arise in cases in which judges and speakers speak in relevantly divergent conversational contexts. I worry that any principle predicting the truth, and indeed propriety, of these sentences cannot plausibly be identified with the knowledge norm of assertion. (DeRose does offer some discussion of this worry much later in the book; again, one could wish for a more unified treatment.)

Another of the prominent competitors to ‘knows’ contextualism is MacFarlane-style relativism. About this sort of view, DeRose says almost nothing at all, except insofar as he offers a contextualist treatment of disagreement; this is relevant because the contextualist’s alleged failure to render disagreement possible is standardly thought to comprise a central motivation for relativism. The discussion of the motivation for, and the resources of, contextualism in contrast to traditional invariantism are by far the strongest points of the book; the dismissal of sensitive invariantism is both less focused and less compelling; and other strategies, such as the relativist one, are barely mentioned.

Although DeRose’s book will be of interest primarily to those engaged in the literature on knowledge and knowledge attributions, it also contains some ideas of more general methodological interest. His primary grounds for contextualism, as he presents them, “come from how knowledge-attributing (and knowledge-denying) sentences are used in ordinary, non-philosophical talk” (p. 47). Although it is something of an orthodoxy to describe philosophy as taking as central data facts about folk or philosophers’ intuitions, some recent methodologically-minded philosophers have denied that this is true in general. DeRose, however, presents an extremely clear case of someone who relies explicitly and extensively on the intuitive judgments of nonphilosophers. Over and over again, DeRose makes claims about what sentences are natural, or what the folk would say, or how ordinary speakers would react to various hypothetical scenarios, and he is explicit in his reliance on these claims in support for his view about ‘knows’. This methodological framework invites a number of questions.

One question concerns the metasemantic picture that underwrites the use of ordinary intuitions about applications of terms in theorizing about linguistic items. DeRose says only a little in much detail here, but what he says suggests a rather strong connection between intuitions and semantics; he says, for example, that many true semantic claims are true in virtue of facts about how we respond intuitively to various cases (p. 67). DeRose makes this claim only passingly; how does it bear on broader questions about internalism and externalism in semantics, for example? On anything like a causal theory of reference, it is difficult to see how the tight connection DeRose proposes will be present.

DeRose also makes a number of claims about the ‘best cases’ to consider when eliciting various kinds of intuitions. He offers a number of characteristics of the best cases to consider when evaluating contextualism, among these, that the cases not involve far-fetched skeptical scenarios, that there be no disagreement between speakers in a conversation, and that positive assertions, rather than negative denials, of knowledge be made (p. 56). He says little in defense of these methodological preferences, except that doing so gives the proposed contextualist devices “their best shot at working” (p. 164). I should like to have heard more about why this sort of strategy is legitimate. DeRose asks us to consider the cases that are ‘best’ — but are these cases the best in some neutral sense, or are they merely the ones that are most likely to produce contextualist intuitions? On the plausible hypotheses that intuitions are easily shiftable in many ways, and are sometimes mistaken, there is no straightforward inference available from ‘contextualist-friendly’ to ‘best’.

A third methodological question concerns the status of DeRose’s various claims of intuitiveness. He seems very confident in his many judgments about what ordinary people think and find natural; he is also happy to extend his claims to rather fine-grained ordinary intuitions, such as the intuition that various pragmatic oddities are ‘strange but true’, and to theoretical intuitions like the claim that two subjects in divergent stakes situations “cannot differ from one another on the matter of whether they know the proposition in question” (p. 88, fn. 9; p. 193). He repeatedly makes claims prefaced with remarks like “I’m confident that if you ask ordinary speakers” (e.g., p. 179, fn. 21). It is, therefore, no surprise that experimental philosophers have felt motivated to ask ordinary speakers about the sorts of cases DeRose considers. There are now a number of experimental tests of the intuitiveness of the contextualist response in a number of cases (e.g., forthcoming works by Buckwalter, Feltz and Zarpentine, May et al., and Knobe and Schaffer); many of these studies take themselves to find reason to doubt some of DeRose’s claims of intuitiveness. The present book does not mention any of the new experimental work in this area. Since experimental work is quite new, DeRose’s omission is perhaps excusable. Nevertheless, the book is already not-quite-up-to-date on this question. And DeRose’s methodological profile makes it an extremely pressing one.

The Case for Contextualism offers an extended sympathetic treatment of contextualism about ‘knows’. DeRose is at his most compelling when on defense; he succeeds in establishing that the contextualist has many more resources for responding to apparent objections than is sometimes recognized — the book, therefore, fills an important role in reminding the reader that contextualism is still an option to be taken seriously. The positive case, on the whole, is less clear. DeRose’s emphasis on ordinary language helpfully turns attention to important methodological questions, but the answers DeRose suggests need further development and integration into a compositional semantics, and to be accompanied with a metasemantics that explains and justifies DeRose’s methodological choices.