Not every book of interest to philosophers is itself a work of philosophy; nor does every such book have to be about a work of philosophy. Signe Cohen’s The Classical Upaniṣads: A Guide is such a book. It is an excellent historical study of the thirteen classical Upaniṣads, a genre of text that the Sanskrit tradition classifies as scripture (śruti) and not as philosophy. Nevertheless, the Upaniṣads were of great interest to Sanskrit philosophers and theologians, modern Indian intellectuals, and European philosophers such as Hegel, Schelling, and Schopenhauer. As Cohen’s study makes clear, the Upaniṣads prefigure worldviews, concepts, and lines of arguments that were developed and debated by Sanskrit philosophers for centuries and, in some cases, are taken to be authoritative by contemporary Sanskrit philosophers and philosophical theologians. After all, it is only in the Upaniṣads that the ideas of a persisting self (ātman); a singular reality that grounds all that there is (brahman); salvation through knowledge (jñāna) instead of through action; and karma and reincarnation are introduced into Sanskrit thought.
Cohen’s book is divided into eight chapters. In Chapter 1, the Introduction, Cohen explains that the Upaniṣads are a genre of over 200 anonymous texts composed in Sanskrit by scholarly collectives (and not individual authors) from the eighth century BCE onwards. Their primary concerns are a “person’s inner self” (ātman), a singular “cosmic divine force” (brahman), and the relation between the two, knowledge of which may lead to immortality and liberation. Among the 200 known Upaniṣads, some identify the inner self with a persisting substance, while others identify it with deities such as Viṣṇu, Śiva, or the Goddess (and even Allah and Christ). Some take the cosmic divine force to be identical to these deities, while others take it to be distinct. Still others take the relation between the self and such deities to be fictional. There is no singular philosophy of the Upaniṣads.
Cohen’s book is a study of the 13 classical Upaniṣads, which precede the others by several centuries. Cohen does an excellent job of introducing the genre, explaining how the classical Upaniṣads were closely connected to the various Vedic branches (śākhās) from which they originated and how, over time, these connections became increasingly performative. By the time the eighth-century philosophical theologian (or dharmalogian) Śaṅkara composed his commentaries on 10 of the 13 classical Upaniṣads, for example, Cohen shows that the Upaniṣads had begun to “assume a life of their own.” Cohen further explains what this means by showing how later scholarly collectives created new Upaniṣads in support of their own worldviews and claims to their antiquity and authority.
In Chapters 2, 3, and 5, Cohen discusses the historical context of the classical Upaniṣads, their dating and authorship, and their social and political contexts, including their geography, representations of daily life, and views on class and social structure. As Cohen explains, the classical Upaniṣads were composed from roughly 800 BCE to 100 CE in North India, between the Himalaya mountains in the North, the Bay of Bengal in the East, the Indus River in the Northwest, and the Vindhya mountains in the South. Since the Upaniṣads were oral compositions that were transmitted orally for at least a millennium before they were written down, dating them with any precision is all but impossible. The oldest extant manuscripts only date to the 16th century. The dates of the Upaniṣads that Cohen provides are simply estimates based on the best available linguistic, literary, and historical evidence. Most of what is known about the Upaniṣads is based on the Upaniṣads themselves or from comparing them with the four Vedas, which in their current linguistic form may be dated to 1500–1000BCE. Compared to the pastoral society of the Vedas, for example, the socio-cultural world of the Upaniṣads is urban and one in which goods, people, and ideas travelled over long distances. The Vedas’ almost singular focus is ritual, ritual theory, and the worldly ends (rain, cows, sons, and long life) to which specific ritual practices are said to be the means. It is only in the Upaniṣads that soteriology and the philosophical concepts needed to account for the possibility of escaping from the cycle of birth, death, and rebirth are developed. In light of this, Cohen discusses the relationship between the Upaniṣads and Buddhism and Jainism, and argues against two accounts of their relationship. On one widely held account, the Upaniṣads can be divided into two groups, those that were composed before Buddhism and those that were composed after. Cohen rightly asks how one can make this determination given the complexities of dating both the early Upaniṣads and the historical Buddha. According to a second account, both the Upaniṣads and the traditions of Buddhism and Jainism emerged from the common culture of “Greater Magadha.” About this, Cohen rightly notes that while the hypothesis may help explain some of the similarities between the Upaniṣads and Buddhism and Jainism, it doesn’t provide a compelling account of their differences, which are better explained by the view that the earliest Upaniṣads preceded both. In contrast, Cohen notes that by the time of the middle Upaniṣads there is ample evidence for a mutual exchange of ideas.
In Chapters 4 and 6, Cohen provides helpful summaries of each of the 13 classical Upaniṣads and discusses what she takes to be their “central ideas.” Cohen discusses: (a) the self (ātman), which in the Upaniṣads is variously taken to be the creator of the universe, the body, the impersonal essence of a living being, a deity, or a personal god; (b) the person (puruṣa), which some Upaniṣads argue is identical to the self while others argue is distinct from the self and still others argue is all that there really is; (c) brahman, a cosmic/divine force that permeates the universe, which some Upaniṣads claim to be fundamental and the impersonal material and instrumental cause of the universe, while others claim it is the creation of a personal god and is itself personal; (d) time (kala), which is often taken to be a reality unto itself in the Upaniṣads, while in the Vedas it is interpreted almost exclusively in terms of ritual action; (e) karma and reincarnation, which for the first time in Sanskrit thought are used to refer to the law that connects personal actions to results that may be realized in this life or future lives and the cycle of rebirth; (f) knowledge and liberation, which in the Upaniṣads are related as means and end, such that knowledge of the identity between atman and brahman is said to be transformative and frees one from the cycle of rebirth; and (g) mantras, sound, and language, which are discussed in terms of their origin, ontology, powers, and limitations. Both of these chapters are impressive, as Cohen manages to cover a lot of ground efficiently and in some detail.
In Chapter 7, Cohen turns to literary aspects of the classical Upaniṣads and introduces over two dozen of the Upaniṣads’ best known characters, discussing how, where, and why they appear in the corpus. The narratives in which these characters appear are, as Cohen notes, sometimes taken from the Vedas and then modified in the Upaniṣads. For example, in the Vedas, the stories of Naciketas and Yājñavalkya focus on ritual and ritual theory, while in the Upaniṣads both stories focus on the self. Of greatest relevance to philosophers, however, may be Cohen’s remarks on the dialogical form of the Upaniṣads. Ideas in the Upaniṣads are developed through extended dialogs between teachers and their students, teachers and kings, and teachers and their rivals. The dialogs are not open ended, however, and it is almost always readily apparent whose point of view carries the day. As Cohen points out, Yājñāvalkya is rewarded with a thousand cows for his victory in a debate sponsored by King Janaka of Videha; the overconfident teacher, Dṛpti Bālākī is forced to accept that the King Ajātaśastru of Kāśī ought to be his teacher; and, due to his lack of knowledge, Śāṇḍilya’s head is literally split apart. The dialogical model of inquiry that is developed in the Upaniṣads is the dominant model for almost all later Sanskrit philosophy, where ideas and arguments are developed through extended debates between a proponent and a series of opponents, both historical and imagined.
In Chapter 8, Cohen provides reception histories for the Upaniṣads by tracing their influence on modern Hinduism and Hindu thought; their use by Muslim intellectuals; and their reception in 18th–19th century Europe by Hegel, Schelling, and Schopenhauer, itself made possible by Abraham Anquetil-Duperron’s (1731–1805) two volume Latin translation of Dara Shiko’s 1657 Persian translation of select Upaniṣads. This latter history points to a time in the history of philosophy when the work of European philosophers was informed by texts from distant places and times. Cohen’s final chapter also includes a list of published translations and printed editions of the classical Upaniṣads. The book concludes with a helpful glossary and bibliography.
The Classical Upaniṣads: A Guide is a well-written, carefully documented, and informative book. It is a book that philosophers interested in the history of Sanskrit philosophical traditions and early Indian thought ought to read and teach. And while it is not itself a work of philosophy or even about a work of philosophy, Cohen’s book is one that professional philosophers can turn to with interest and profit.