Many existing prisons are deeply unjust spaces, rife with violence, racial inequality, and inhumane conditions. In The Idea of Prison Abolition, Tommie Shelby analyzes Angela Davis’s arguments that these manifest injustices call for prison abolition. Ultimately, Shelby argues for radical reform over abolition because reformed prisons can accomplish the essential state function of crime control without the attendant grave injustices that plague many existing prisons.
The thrust of the book is that the myriad ways that existing prisons are unjust are distinguishable from the essential features of prisons that contribute to crime control. The central argument is a response to three abolitionist objections to prisons: dehumanization, links to slavery, and racial subjugation. Shelby concludes that each of these unjust features are accidental aspects of prisons that can be eliminated through reform, not inherent features of prisons that require abolition.
Prisons and Their Legitimate Purpose
Shelby defines a prison as a state-based institution that “forcibly confines prisoners within an enclosed space, physically separates them from the public, claims custodial guardianship over them, subjects them to the directives of prison officials, and treats them in these ways as a penalty for criminal offenses” (88).
Shelby argues that prisons, as described above, can serve a legitimate function in a reasonably just state by controlling serious crime through deterrence, incapacitation, and rehabilitation. Crime control is an essential state function because the state is obligated to protect members from serious personal violations, as well as to maintain essential institutions that enable members to thrive, like the economy. Still, incarceration is deeply harmful, so it can only be justified to control the most serious crimes, namely murder, sexual assault, and the most damaging white-collar crimes.
Prisons are not Inherently or Incorrigibly Unjust
Having identified a legitimate purpose for prisons, Shelby considers three major arguments from Angela Davis that prisons are by their very nature unjust. Davis argues that prisons are dehumanizing; they are vestiges of slavery; and their true function is racial subordination. Shelby examines each of these critiques of prisons with the legitimate purpose of crime control in mind. He argues that while abolitionist critiques rightly condemn many existing prisons, they do not apply to prisons as such. Reform rather than abolition will allow us to create prisons that are not dehumanizing, that bear none of the morally salient features of slavery, and that function to control crime without racial subjugation.
Dehumanization
Many of the practices of existing prisons are dehumanizing. Invasive body searches, cramped living spaces with no privacy, lack of medical care and hygienic conditions, violence, sexual assault, and verbal abuse are all too common in existing prisons. These features are all dehumanizing, and we should reform prisons to rid them of these features. But, Shelby argues, if you removed all these practices from a prison, it would still be a prison.
Davis could argue that involuntary confinement, even absent the inhumane conditions listed above, is already dehumanizing because it denies the agency of those confined. Against this, Shelby argues that involuntary confinement does not treat those incarcerated as non-agents when it is used as a proportional consequence of the most serious criminal wrongdoing. When involuntary confinement results from due process, incarceration recognizes wrongdoers as agents who can conform their actions to a moral code but have chosen not to do so. Appealing to a sort of contractualist view, he writes, “Those who wrong others in ways that typically cause great harm cannot reasonably object to the unpleasant and coercive treatment their own wrongful conduct has called forth, provided such treatment is necessary to prevent harm to others” (61). The need to protect members of society from the gravest wrongs of murder and serious assault provides a legitimate basis for the state to use incarceration to deter and incapacitate.
Moreover, Shelby argues that neither involuntary confinement nor violence are inherently dehumanizing. Forced quarantining to control the spread of deadly illnesses and detaining prisoners of war until hostilities end are generally taken to be morally permissible, so involuntary confinement itself is not always unjust. As for violence, most abolitionists, including Davis, have expressed support for the violence involved in slave revolts and self-defense by victims of sexual assault. Thus, the fact that prisons include involuntary confinement or violence cannot on its own make prisons unjust or dehumanizing.
Slavery
Davis argues that prisons descended from slavery, noting the way black codes and convict leasing arose shortly after slavery was abolished. Shelby values this genealogical critique as a demonstration that prisons are not inevitable or natural. Still, the historical connections between prisons and slavery do not require abolition unless they also show that the features that made slavery unjust are also inherent in prisons.
Shelby argues we can distinguish the unjust features that some existing prisons share with slavery from the inherent features of prisons. Commodification of people, torture, and corporal punishment are unjust features that many existing prisons share with slavery. They should be eliminated, but they are not inherent in prisons. The central moral wrong of slavery is that enslavers held absolute and arbitrary power over those they enslaved. While the state does claim significant power over those it incarcerates, if due process is followed, this power is neither absolute nor arbitrary. When incarceration is the result of due process in a reasonably just society, the power the state exercises is legitimate and limited, not arbitrary and absolute.
Davis often points to involuntary labor as an obvious connection between slavery and prisons. Shelby argues that involuntary labor itself is not necessarily unjust. If one thinks that community service as a punishment can be legitimate, then it cannot be that involuntary labor is always unjust. Certainly, private profit from the involuntary labor of incarcerated people is disconcerting at least, but Shelby notes that much prison labor is devoted to reducing the costs of incarceration for the state, such as contributing to provision of room and board. What makes much of the labor in existing prisons unjust is the working conditions, not the involuntariness of the labor. Unfair working conditions within prisons must be eliminated if prison labor is to be legitimate. For example, labor in prisons should offer worker protections much like non-prison labor: workers should have the ability to organize unions and strike, safe working conditions, and a fair wage. Moreover, Shelby emphasizes that while we should be attentive to abuses of prison labor, many incarcerated people have reasons to work while incarcerated. Work is a way to combat boredom, earn money, and build skills that are valuable after release. Thus, involuntary labor is not unjust in all cases but should be carefully circumscribed if it is to be just.
Shelby also addresses a broader way that prisons can be seen as a legacy of slavery. In the US, descendants of enslaved people are disproportionately subjected to the harms of incarceration. He emphasizes the need for corrective justice for descendants of enslaved people and the elimination of broader racial and class structural injustices. But he does not see prisons as the source of such injustices nor abolition as an appropriate remedy.
Racism
One common refrain in the abolitionist movement is that the disproportionate racial impact of the criminal legal system is not an unfortunate byproduct, but the point of prisons. Shelby calls this argument a ‘functional critique’ of prisons, which claims that the true function of prisons is not crime control or justice, but racial subjugation. Shelby analyzes the functional critique argument, noting that this claim is difficult to prove empirically and may seem implausible if it is interpreted to mean that the only reason prisons have continued to exist is because they maintain racial oppression.
In the end, however, he argues that even if it is true that existing prisons do function with the real purpose of racial subjugation, this does not necessitate abolition. The functional critique does not demand abolition unless there is no legitimate function, consistent with a just society, that prisons can perform better than any other institution. He returns to the argument that, through deterrence, incapacitation, and rehabilitation, prisons can play an essential role in crime control. Because there is nothing inherent in prisons that produces racial subjugation, the functional critique does not justify abolition.
The functional critique argument raises the question of how to understand the nature of institutional racism. Shelby posits two ways that institutions can be understood as racist. Intrinsic institutional racism is marked by intentional discrimination or uncorrected past intentional bias. Intrinsic institutional racism can be eliminated by removing discriminatory policies. Extrinsic institutional racism is where there are neutral aims and policies in the institution, but due to background social injustices, these neutral policies have a racially biased impact. The way to address extrinsic institutional racism is to correct the background injustice.
As the discussion of institutional racism suggests, Shelby argues that it is not prisons themselves that are irredeemably racist. Rather, prisons are conduits for the racial injustices and structural inequalities that are present in the rest of American society. Prisons can be rid of institutional racism by eliminating discriminatory practices and addressing background injustice. Indeed, nearly all institutions in the US reproduce anti-black racism: schools mistreat black students, child services departments disproportionately break up black families, and employers discriminate against black workers. But we do not march in the streets to abolish schools, workplaces, or families. It is thus not prisons themselves, but this background structural racism that must be remedied. “Don’t abolish the prison; abolish the ghetto” (201).
Other Topics
This book also offers chapter-length treatments on related themes in Davis’s work. Shelby argues that black radical prison narratives served as consciousness-raising tools for fellow poor black people, not as tools of moral suasion for white audiences, as slave narratives did. In response to the perverse incentives from for-profit business in the prison industrial complex, Shelby proposes that non-profits could provide essential prison services when the state cannot effectively do so. He also shares with abolitionists a commitment to building alternative approaches to crime control, including robust economic justice, provision of mental health care and substance abuse treatment, strong rehabilitation programs for those who commit crimes, and restorative and transformative justice. Still, Shelby doubts these alternatives will sufficiently limit serious crimes, so these should be paired with a minimal prison system to deter and incapacitate. Finally, Shelby discusses the utopian potential of the abolitionist vision. The abolitionist goal of a world without prisons can work as a ‘regulative ideal’ to guide us toward a more just society with economic equality, fair provision of social goods, and corrective racial justice measures, even if achieving these ends will not fully eliminate the need for prisons.
Abolition and Conceptual Analysis
This book is a valuable contribution to analytic philosophy of criminal law and punishment because it directly engages with abolitionist views from outside the academy. As Shelby rightly notes, too often Angela Davis is “treated as a mere symbol of black radicalism and militancy” instead of receiving “critical and respectful engagement that distinguished white or male philosophers regularly receive” (15). Shelby’s treatment has already fostered more nuanced, critical and respectful engagement with abolitionism in mainstream political philosophy.
More mainstream philosophical engagement with abolitionism is needed, but it is unclear if Shelby’s methodology is the best way to understand the claims of activist abolitionists. His approach is ideal theory in that the arguments are based on the concept of prisons and their conceptually necessary features. Shelby asks whether prisons are inherently dehumanizing, dominating, or racist. The book’s arguments are also analytical in the sense of breaking concepts and arguments into smaller component parts. Shelby singles out aspects of prisons to determine if, on their own, each aspect conceptually must result in injustice. Indeed, violence, involuntary labor or confinement, or historical links to slavery might not produce injustice on their own, but prisons include all these features together. Shelby’s arguments do not address whether, in existing societies, prisons, with all these features, can control crime without an intolerable risk of injustice.