One of the central debates in the philosophy of perception over the past several decades has been about whether naïve realism or representationalism better captures the fundamental nature of perception. The former view treats the experience of seeing a yellow pencil on the table as constituted by our relation to that very object and its properties. An indistinguishable hallucination of a yellow pencil is something else entirely, and not explained by appeal to the relations that ground genuine perceptual experience. In contrast, the representationalist typically seeks to explain perception and hallucination in a unified way. Instead of focusing on the relation to existing objects and properties, they believe our experiences involve the representation of objects and properties. There are several flavors of representationalism aligned in opposition to the relational view. The variant of interest here is what Papineau calls essentialist representationalism, which takes perceptual experiences to be constituted by the representation of objects possessing properties like yellow and pencil-shaped, even in cases where there may be no such objects or properties instantiated.
The arguments on either side of this debate have occurred in several domains. These include considerations arising from the epistemic role of perception, arguments grounded in the transparency of experience, prospects for a naturalized account of sensory consciousness, arguments for and against truth conditional perceptual contents, and from appeals to introspection. This has been a rich debate, with many papers and books written in defense of one side or the other.
David Papineau’s slim volume is a welcome addition to these debates. Instead of defending one of the sides, or trying somehow to reconcile them, he rejects both naïve realism and essentialist representationalism. In their place he defends an alternative “qualitative view” according to which sensory experiences are intrinsic qualitative properties of people. These qualitative properties, when properly embedded in an environment, can come to contingently represent objects and properties in the external world. Once embedded, we can use the representational properties of our experiences to indirectly refer to the experiences and to make predictions about the structure and relations between experiences, but it does not follow from these uses that the experiences themselves are essentially tied to their representational contents. This view, while similar to existing sense-data and adverbialist accounts of sensory experience, rejects the most problematic elements of those views.
The book is a delight to read, with a clear and focused discussion of the central metaphysical issues. It gets right to the point and doesn’t meander or get bogged down in secondary issues. It is filled with interesting arguments and observations, and the trenchant criticisms of naturalistic versions of essentialist representationalism are especially compelling. The book is essential reading for anyone with an interest in recent philosophy of perception. Which is not to say that there aren’t a number of provocative claims and arguments in the book that will be sure to spark further discussion and debate (I will note some of my own quibbles below).
The book is composed of four short chapters. It begins in the first chapter, “Clearing the Ground,” by providing important definitions and clarifications that provide the foundation for everything that follows. Papineau focusses on “sensory experience” rather than “perceptual experience,” thereby avoiding worries about “perception” having a success reading. He also makes clear that in using this terminology he doesn’t have in mind anything like the classical sensation-perception distinction. Instead, the idea is to focus in a neutral way on the experiences that include perceptual episodes in the major sensory modalities, but which also includes non-perceptual cases like hallucination and a host of other sensory experiences like proprioception, itch, and pain, which may or may not count as genuinely perceptual. A small downside of the narrow focus on the general metaphysical issues is that Papineau does not explore or discuss many details about this variety. This is a bit of a missed opportunity, especially later in the book, where sensory experiences like nausea, thirst, and tiredness would seemingly provide stronger examples of sensory experiences whose qualitative properties don’t seem particularly externalized, or detailed, or transparent in any way. Such cases plausibly provide some of the best evidence in favor of the contingency view and might help Papineau address some worries that arise about his account of introspection (an issue to which we will return). That said, it is welcome that the view is framed from the start in this inclusive, neutral way.
The first chapter also importantly provides an initial characterization of naïve realism, and runs through some of the more common criticisms of the view (worries about time-lag between experiences and the objects of experience, especially salient when viewing very distant objects; asymmetries between qualitative and objective properties; the posit of conscious differences that are not introspectable, etc.). The chapter also includes a brief discussion of sense-data views and provides an initial characterization of representationalism. There are two main distinctions drawn here: between “contingent” and “essential” representationalists, and between “naturalists” and “phenomenal intentionalists.” The essentialist version is of course the main target, and it holds that the conscious qualitative properties of an experience are essentially identical to their representational contents. The naturalists try to explain sensory consciousness in terms of a naturalized account of representation, whereas the phenomenal intentionalists go in the other direction, explaining intentional representation in terms of phenomenal properties. While both receive discussion and criticism in the book, the most interesting arguments are directed at essentialist naturalism.
The focus of the book on this central debate is, as I said, welcome, but it also can be a bit misleading. While a lot of work in the philosophy of perception has focused on these two opposing views, there have also been many alternative views discussed and defended in recent years that don’t fit neatly into either camp. There have been various instrumental and quasi-skeptical approaches like those defended by Daniel Dennett and others, identity theories as defended by Chris Hill (1991), forms of phenomenal primitivism, the sensory classification view defended by Mohan Matthen (2005), enactive and Neo-Gibsonian approaches that share some affinities with naïve realism but offer a distinct set of metaphysical proposals about the nature of sensory experience. And of course, there have been many theorists especially in the philosophy of neuroscience, who defend a more mechanistic, reductive account of sensory consciousness, many of which seem entirely consistent with contingent representationalism. In addition to these many approaches that already seem to stand apart from both naïve realism and essentialist representationalism, there have also been many theorists, including myself, who have long been unhappy with both alternatives and hold some form of contingent representationalism. While the book is focused on a narrow target, namely sensory experiences, and not on an account of consciousness in general or a detailed explanation of qualitative properties, it would have been nice to have a bit more detail about this broader landscape of views and how the discussion here connects with this other work. Even so, the discussion here is insightful and important, showing the kind of view that might be possible once we reject the two dominant alternatives.
In Chapter 2, entitled “Against Representationalism,” we get, as you might expect, a focused argument against essentialist representationalism. The focus here is on the lack of metaphysical detail in extant defenses of the representational view. The main thrust of the complaint is that the identification of qualitative sensory properties with the representation of distal physical properties is never fully elaborated or filled in and comes with significant metaphysical costs. There are critical discussions of broad contents, transparency, and the many issues with uninstantiated properties, all of which Papineau takes to reveal a view with many serious problems.
Near the end of the chapter, we get a clear statement of Papineau’s positive view, which takes the conscious properties of our sensory experiences to be contingently representational, in the same way that words in natural language are.
In truth, what we are aware of when we introspect are properties of ourselves, conscious properties whose instantiations constitute sensory experience. The sensory experiences do in fact represent features of the worlds beyond, but this is an entirely contingent matter, deriving from the way they are environmentally embedded. The experiences themselves are no more intrinsically directed beyond themselves than are the marks and sounds that make up the words in a human language. (75)
While Papineau is certainly right here to contest the idea that sensory experiences are essentially representational, the analogy with words does not accurately reflect the biological role of sensory processing and our current best understanding of it in terms of information processing. I would have liked some more discussion of sensory systems as seeming to serve the function of carrying information about distal items. This role seems quite different from the more conventional way that words come to play a representational role in natural language. It seems likely that there are some biological and evolutionary constraints on how sensory systems carry and make available distal information through their intrinsic qualitative properties. Not least because the systems that perform these functions are extraordinarily complex, biologically ancient systems whose representational capacities are more intertwined than the analogy with words might suggest. This isn’t to say that we should embrace essentialism. I think that Papineau is right that representational properties are had by sensory experiences only contingently, and that they can come apart in extraordinary circumstances or across species. But the correlations of these properties in creatures like us, embedded in the world we inhabit, nevertheless seems quite robust and near universal for a wide range of properties. At least robust enough to allow us to make useful generalizations and predictions through the assignment of representational contents.
In Chapter 3, “The Structure of Experience,” Papineau lays out in more detail his positive view and contrasts it with similar views defended by Ned Block and Christopher Peacocke. The qualitative view is simple in form: sensory experiences are properties intrinsically had by a person, and not relations to objects or properties, or essentially identical with or realized by representational properties. They can come to have representational properties, but only contingently. The metaphor used (with ample caveats) is that sensory experiences are like images on a television screen. They have their sensory properties intrinsically, but they can come to represent distal items when the local properties are suitably related to them. This is another gloss on the contingency claim that was expressed earlier in terms of natural language. The view has several advantages, mostly arising from its avoidance of the problems facing the other views. It does not falter with issues of time-lag for the perception of distal objects or lack or correlations between experiences and objective properties. It can give a universal account of hallucination without positing merely intentional objects. And so on. The main thrust is that this sort of view doesn’t face any of the main metaphysical challenges or puzzles described in the previous chapters.
For a positive account of the metaphysics of sensory consciousness, however, we don’t get much discussion of the plausible intrinsic physical properties that might ground sensory consciousness. One reason naturalistic representationalism was so popular is that it purported to offer a physicalist friendly account of sensory consciousness. When the view is rejected here, it’s natural to wonder if we’ve made progress or returned to square one. As noted above, there are many views available. While I don’t think anyone is expecting a detailed discussion or evaluation of these views here, of course, it would be nice to have a little more detail about how the qualitative view relates to these other positions on the metaphysics of consciousness.
The final chapter, “Introspection, Adverbialism, and Rich Contents,” contains a discussion of several additional, largely independent issues. As the chapter title suggests, one of the main focuses here is providing an account of introspection. Both representationalists and naïve realists alike seem to agree that introspective evidence supports their preferred view. For instance, the whole idea of transparency holds that when we introspect our sensory experiences, the only properties of which we are aware are those possessed by the objects of our experience. Papineau spends some time laying out the case that for him transparency is a kind of illusion. On his view, we also do not have direct observational awareness of our sensory experiences; we need an alternative account of introspection. He isn’t committed to any particular view here. Instead, he is surveying and considering various options. The proposal he lands on is that we become aware of our sensory states through our access to the beliefs that we form on the basis of these states. When we have an experience, we form beliefs about the things the experience is about, and we in turn use these beliefs to introspect and become aware of the kind of sensory state we are in: “my suggestion is that our introspective identification of sensory experiences piggy-backs on our identification of the beliefs they give rise to” (123). There is a worry about how we come to know the modality of our experiences as well, and several similar suggestions are offered.
While the earlier chapters focused on the ways in which naïve realism and essentialist representationalism departed from common sense and general folk theory, this indirect view of introspection also feels like a departure from common sense. The idea that we can only know what our sensory experiences are like indirectly, through awareness of the beliefs they form on the basis of representational properties they have only contingently, is a strong departure from the idea that we have direct, unmediated access to our own sensory experiences. Indeed, many theorists have held that awareness of our sensory experiences are the very things we know best and most directly (to be clear, I do not agree with such views. I note only the departure).
Overall, I think this is a very solid and important book. Its criticisms of essentialist representationalism are especially welcome. The main criticism one might have after reading the book is that it is primarily negative. This will of course raise issues among devotees of the targeted views. But the more serious worry is that, while it suggests a positive view, we aren’t given many details or positive defenses of the qualitative view. Instead, the positive view is promoted primarily through rejection of the main alternatives. I find myself in agreement with Papineau’s arguments here, but we are left with a number of available positions that are seemingly consistent with the qualitative view, and little guidance about the many theoretical challenges that remain for a metaphysical account of how conscious phenomenal character arises as an intrinsic property of subjects.
ACKNOWLEDGMENTS
I would like to thank Noam Tiran, Jonathan Cohen, Mohan Matthen, and David Papineau for their helpful comments.
REFERENCES
Hill, Christopher S. (1991). Sensations: A Defense of Type Materialism. New York: Cambridge University Press.
Matthen, Mohan (2005). Seeing, Doing, and Knowing: A Philosophical Theory of Sense Perception. Oxford, GB: Oxford University Press UK.