Is property dualism really the best way out between the Scylla of physicalism and the Charybdis of substance dualism? Ralph Weir’s book builds on the growing discontent with physicalism among philosophers of mind, accompanied by a simultaneous aversion to substance dualism, with property dualism allegedly being a more adequate and defensible metaphysics of mind. His main argument, the parity argument, builds on the common ground between virtually all dualists (property or substance)—the conceivability argument—and concludes that if one accepts the conceivability argument, one should accept the existence of mental substances. The book is thus a defense of substance dualism.
The first four of the seven chapters are preparatory. Chapter 1 discusses the question of why the soul—the popular term for mental or nonphysical substance—is so unpopular in our culture at large. Weir diagnoses our age as being “psychephobic”: “For many, dualism is not just mistaken, it is odious” (7). According to Weir, this aversion is in part to be explained by three misconceptions. First, and this is an objection some Christian theologians hold against dualism, there is the idea that soul-body dualism is an idiosyncratic, Greek view grafted onto Christianity. Weir responds that on the one hand, if one believes in the intermediate state between death and resurrection (like N.T. Wright does), one must be prepared to affirm soul-body dualism; on the other hand, there is ample evidence from non-Greek cultures for belief in soul-body dualism. Second, there is the charge that dualism is responsible for all the evils in the Western world, an idea Weir effortlessly shows to rest on suggestive and weak reasoning. The third misconception is that dualism has nothing going for it intellectually. Weir points out that it is rather materialism that consistently leaves the riddle of consciousness unsolved, whereas dualism offers a straightforward answer to it, and that objections against dualism (especially the interaction problem, see (Cucu and Pitts 2019; Cucu 2022; 2024)) are at least far less serious than typically assumed. Regarding empirical support for soul-body dualism however, Weir strangely ignores the most obvious evidence—near-death experiences (NDEs)—about which there is an ample and well-researched literature (cf. Habermas 2018). Instead, he demands that empirical findings pro dualism be reproducible (which NDEs are not), amounting to something like a “paranormal science”. However, as all who are engaged in historical research know, empiricism and reproducibility are orthogonal concepts.
Chapter 2 tracks down some reasons for the move away from substance dualism in the second half of the twentieth century. Part of the explanation Weir offers is confusion about the notions of “substance” and “property”, a confusion he sets out to remedy in that same chapter. Weir’s preferred definition of substance is the Cartesian independence definition: x being a substance means that “the existence of x does not necessitate the existence of anything other than x” (39). As Weir rightly points out, this ontological independence is crucial for the classical version of substance dualism which entails the possibility of disembodiment. Weir’s clear awareness of the centrality of disembodiment makes it all the more astounding that NDEs are not even mentioned by him.
Since the independence definition is so important, it needs to be defended against objections. This is the task of chapter 3. The main threat arises from the property-dependence objection, which says that nothing can truly exist independently of anything else because nothing can exist without its properties. To properly address this objection, Weir clarifies and defends the so-called strong metaphysical reading of the independence definition: x being a substance means that x does not necessitate the existence of anything else simpliciter. The weak metaphysical reading, by contrast, has it that x does not necessitate the existence of anything in particular. It took me a bit to fully appreciate the difference between those two readings. Perhaps it would have been clearer to say that on the strong reading, a substance can exist as the only thing in a world, while on the weak reading there must exist other things as well where only the totality of those things is a necessary condition for the existence of x, not one thing or things in particular.
The gist of his defense is that properties should not be counted among the things without which a substance can exist. “The real problem [. . .] is that no candidate substance could exist without some concrete properties or [. . .] parts.” (68). To deny that a solitary coffee cup on the table can exist independently because it cannot exist without its properties and proper parts is a misconstrual of the original claim, according to Weir. I agree: it is better to specify that x existing independently means that it exists without anything over and above it (Weir’s preferred turn of phrase) rather than without anything identical to it (which includes properties and thus incurs the property-dependence objection).
Chapter 4 lays out the topography of responses to the mind-body problem in light of the independence definition of substance, and in light of the popularity of Russellian Monism (RM). It was here that I began to wonder whether Weir could have settled for one choice of terms. In section 4.2.1 he says that property dualists must posit “hybrid” substances, metaphysically complete things that have both physical and nonphysical properties. What he arguably means by “nonphysical” is “mental” or “phenomenal”—terms he uses in other places to denote the same thing—and arguably things should be stated this way, because there are also other types of nonphysical properties like ethical, axiological, or aesthetic ones.
Chapter 5 is a watershed in the book: while the previous chapters were concerned with defining the available responses to the mind-body problem, this chapter introduces arguments for the main thesis which is that “if you posit nonphysical properties in response to the mind-body problem, then you should also posit nonphysical substances” (95). Weir introduces two flanking arguments, the symmetry argument and the compresence argument. I briefly sum up the symmetry argument since it reappears later on: it relies on the symmetry principle which says that if x is metaphysically (in)complete without y, then y is metaphysically (in)complete without x. It follows that if physical things are metaphysically complete, then the mental things attached to them must also be metaphysically complete.
At the end of the chapter, Weir’s main argument, the parity argument, makes its first appearance. The parity argument is a nested “Matryoshka” argument that builds on the conceivability argument and the phenomenal disembodiment argument:
(i) If you accept the conceivability argument, you must accept the phenomenal disembodiment argument.
(ii) If you accept the phenomenal disembodiment argument, then you must accept the existence of nonphysical substances.
(iii) Therefore, if you accept the conceivability argument, then you must accept the existence of nonphysical substances.
While the conceivability argument is well-known, the disembodiment argument deserves some elucidation here. It is in fact the converse of the conceivability argument, starting with the premise that the phenomenal facts do not a priori entail the existence of anything physical. Via modal rationalism (conceivability entails possibility), it then arrives at the conclusion that the phenomenal facts do not necessitate the existence of anything physical.
The parity argument is then developed and defended at length in chapter 6. Weir first defends the conceivability of zombies and of disembodied minds (“ghosts”) and then the modal rationalism that entails the possibility of zombies and ghosts, respectively. Of great importance here is the transparency (Goff 2017) or semantic neutrality (Cleeveley 2022) of phenomenal concepts. Such concepts can be fully understood a priori, without recourse to empirical knowledge, and phenomenal concepts seem to be paradigm examples of transparent concepts. Thus, a priori reflection on them enables modal inferences regarding their existence. Though physicalists will typically contest the transparency of phenomenal concepts, Weir’s main audience—property dualists— accepts it, and so arguably has little wiggle room to escape the force of the parity argument.
There is, however, an objection against the possibility of disembodiment from the supposed conceptual opacity of the indexical ‘I’. But as Weir points out, his argument does without reference to selfhood. Thus, it remains unscathed even in case the objection goes through against disembodiment arguments relying on the indexical ‘I’. One may however wonder at this point whether Weir is just being dialectically wise or granting too much. For it seems that phenomenal properties/events must necessarily be had by a subject, pace Hume (see also Moreland and Craig 2017, ch. 11.4.1). Saying that a phenomenal property could exist independently of a mental subject strikes me as analogous to saying that a color could exist without being attached to a physical surface. Indeed, in a Platonic way, both could exist without being instantiated, but Weir rejects this abstract view of properties (see chapter 2.4).
Another objection could be mounted against premise 1 of the phenomenal disembodiment argument. Physicalists could just dig in their heels and insist that phenomenal concepts cannot (in the sense of nomological modality) exist on their own without anything physical. However, premise 1 just addresses the a priori or logical modality of phenomenal concepts. Thus, it seems that the line of attack would have to resort to focusing on premise 2: to denying that conceivability entails possibility, which boils down to the question of the transparency of phenomenal concepts. As indicated above, however, it is hard to see how phenomenal concepts can be opaque.
Chapter 7 finally lays out the consequences of the parity argument for nonphysical substances. One of those consequences concerns the individual self just discussed. Weir suggests a rerun of his parity argument with reference to a purely phenomenal “lonely ghost” instead of a “ghost world”. However, Weir argues, this still does not establish the identity of self and mental substance; rather, it just introduces the minimum requirement that there be at least one substance per individual. This seems to me to be another instance where Weir departs from his otherwise refreshingly intuition-fueled reasoning. Even in the “ghost world” the phenomenal properties arguably belong to subjects; a fortiori, in the “lonely ghost” world, the phenomenal events must belong to that one lonely ghost. And at this point there is an intuitive force to the idea that the lonely ghost has his mental life due to only one mental substance; in fact that he is that mental substance.
The rest of the chapter is devoted to responding to several objections. The complaint by Russellian Monists that the symmetry and compresence arguments are unsuccessful because physical concepts are opaque can be repudiated by pointing out that the parity argument does not rely on any assumptions about the nature of the physical at all. Further, there is the suggestion that something like a transcendental ego might take the place of the classical mental substance. Weir finds substrata as candidates for the transcendental ego wanting and concludes that ultimately, what fits the bill is the conventional mental substance. A last objection is that the conceivability argument may not be the firm foundation Weir makes it out to be. Weir’s response is that the other important anti-physicalist arguments (i.e., the knowledge argument, the explanatory gap argument) rely on much the same intuitions and principles as the conceivability argument.
Ralph Weir’s book is without a doubt an outstanding and very important contribution to the metaphysics of mind. Too long has property dualism been hailed as the better dualism. The Mind-Body Problem and Metaphysics powerfully refutes this notion and introduces substance dualism as the position all dualists need to embrace. The book is written in readable, precise and didactic language. My criticisms are few and minor: the ignoring of NDEs; the terminological switching between “mental/phenomenal” and “nonphysical substance”; and his perhaps too generous concessions to detractors of the likes of Hume.
REFERENCES
Cleeveley, Harry. 2022. “The a Priori Truth of Modal Rationalism.” Philosophical Quarterly 72 (4): 816–36.
Cucu, Alin C. 2022. “Interacting Minds in the Physical World.” PhD thesis, Lausanne: University of Lausanne.
———. 2024. “Turning the Tables: How Neuroscience Supports Interactive Dualism.” Mind and Matter 22 (1): 219–39.
Cucu, Alin C., and J. Brian Pitts. 2019. “How Dualists Should (Not) Respond to the Objection from Energy Conservation.” Mind and Matter 17 (1): 95–121.
Goff, Philipp. 2017. Consciousness and Fundamental Reality. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Habermas, Gary R. 2018. “Evidential Near‐Death Experiences.” The Blackwell Companion to Substance Dualism, 226–46.
Moreland, J.P., and William Lane Craig, eds. 2017. Philosophical Foundations for a Christian Worldview. Revised. Downers Grove, Illinois: IVP ACADEMIC.