Containing 32 essays and weighing 3.5 pounds, this volume is in every sense a massive contribution to Nietzsche scholarship. Ken Gemes and John Richardson deserve congratulations for lining up many good essays, thanks for their clear and helpful introduction, and admiration for coming as close to complete coverage of Nietzsche-related topics as any book could. The essays offer original arguments while remaining accessible to readers who are unfamiliar with the facets of Nietzsche scholarship they address. They're generally of high quality, especially considering the challenges of contributing to a collection organized for breadth and accessibility, as well as originality. I'll devote one paragraph to each of the 32 essays.
The first three essays present a good deal of biographical information that will likely be new to Nietzsche scholars working on other topics. Graham Parkes' well-researched "Nietzsche and the Family" focuses especially on Nietzsche's parents and grandparents. Drawing on family and biographical sources in German as well as the English biographical literature, Parkes tells detailed stories about topics including Nietzsche's parents' courtship and how his father died. Most of the essay focuses on the generations preceding Nietzsche, though his troubled relationship with his sister is briefly discussed at the end. Parkes provides an impressive wealth of detail, even if drawing interpretive or philosophical conclusions from it is hard. I was inexplicably delighted to learn that in her youth, Nietzsche's mother was good at sledding.
If those who prefer to focus on Nietzsche's most impressive philosophical achievements avoid Julian Young's "Nietzsche and Women", they'll miss a detailed and informative picture of how he regressed on feminist issues. The essay begins with Nietzsche's admirable vote in 1874 to allow women into doctoral programs at Basel. His side lost, 6-4. Young sees Nietzsche's turning point towards misogyny in the collapse of his hopeless attempt at a relationship with Lou Salome, which was brutally undermined by his sister, and which ended up bringing his mother's anger upon him as well. Despite the misogynistic remarks that appear in his work after that, several feminists of his time maintained friendships with him, as Carol Diethe has described in detail. As Young notes, many were drawn to his emphasis on overcoming social values that stand in the way of achieving personal excellence, and were willing to overlook his sexist views as a result. Sadly, friendships with women who appreciated insights at the core of his philosophy didn't diminish Nietzsche's misogyny.
"Nietzsche's Illness", by Charlie Huenemann, begins with strong arguments that the medical condition triggering Nietzsche's collapse into dementia was a brain tumor located behind the right eye. This diagnosis should replace the older view that Nietzsche had syphilis, as his doctors at Basel claimed. Huenemann notes that syphilis was widely overdiagnosed before a more reliable test for the disease appeared in 1906, and cites recent medical literature suggesting that a retro-orbital meningioma explains much more about Nietzsche's maladies throughout his life. The second half of Huenemann's contribution discusses Nietzsche's own views on health and madness, categorizing various forms of madness as Nietzsche understood them and describing how they relate to other significant topics in his work. I see Huenemann as providing two useful but unrelated essays in one slot, as he quite sensibly doesn't try to use Nietzsche's conception of health and illness to diagnose him, or try to understand Nietzsche's views on madness and illness in terms of details of his condition that he couldn't have known.
The essays on relations between historical figures and Nietzsche begin with Jessica Berry's "Nietzsche and the Greeks", which discusses the philological profession, Homer, Heraclitus, and Pyrrho. Berry convincingly describes how Nietzsche regarded himself as a philologist throughout his productive life, and how he saw Homer as illustrating the differences between Greek culture and modernity against his fellow philologists, who stressed the similarities. She criticizes interpreters who take Nietzsche's favorable remarks on Heraclitus to suggest that he accepts radical metaphysical views that undermine the existence of objects or the possibility of true belief. (Berry's cutting footnotes against opponents who take excessive liberties with the text make this section especially exciting.) She suggests that we can understand his favorable view of skepticism in light of Pyrrho and the ancient skeptics' practice of undermining metaphysical convictions. Overall, the essay illuminates several ways in which Nietzsche's philosophical views were and weren't shaped by his deep knowledge of classical philosophy and literature.
Adrian Del Caro's "Nietzsche and Romanticism" discusses Nietzsche in relation to Hölderlin, Goethe, and Wagner, presenting him as initially appreciating each figure before becoming more critical. He describes Nietzsche as appreciating Hölderlin's grasp of nihilism before rejecting his nationalism and emphasis on poetry over philosophy, admiring Goethe's full expression of his passions in art before seeing his own work as superior, and admiring Wagner's affinities with the Greeks before turning against his populism and German nationalism. I found the treatment of Nietzsche's criticisms of Hölderlin and Wagner more illuminating than the treatment of Goethe. Nietzsche's brief negative comparative evaluations of Goethe, especially in Ecce Homo, stem more from his immodestly high evaluation of himself than from anything to do with Goethe. This essay differs from others in the volume by having less of the precision typical of Anglo-American philosophy, and more of the allusive style typically found elsewhere in the humanities.
Tom Bailey's essay, titled "Nietzsche the Kantian?", argues that Nietzsche's affinities with Kantian views are deeper than he and many of his interpreters realize. As Bailey notes, Nietzsche's stated objections to Kant on questions concerning the thing-in-itself and normative ethics often are based on misunderstandings of Kant, and don't make contact with Kant's actual positions. In some cases charitably reconstructing the objections by connecting them to Nietzsche's views of agency and other topics might have shown us how they address Kant's actual positions. I hope Bailey's paper will inspire others to do so. Bailey further argues that Nietzsche's discussion of the sovereign individual demonstrates that he shares Kant's view of "agency itself as the highest and unconditional value" (151). Here I'm attracted to an objection he considers: that Nietzsche's sovereign individual is in fact a thoroughly non-Kantian agent with agency determined entirely by "immediate experiences and desires", but whose desires are organized just right to constitute a memory of the will that supports promise-keeping (151). Bailey's knowledge of Kant's metaphysics and ethics, as well as the views of the neo-Kantians, whom Nietzsche knew better, helps him contribute to discussions of Nietzsche's views on a variety of ethical, epistemological, and metaphysical questions. This is also the essay that does the most to address philosophers active in Nietzsche's youth, like Afrikan Spir, Gustav Teichmüller, and Friedrich Lange.
Ivan Soll's title nicely expresses the message of his essay: "Schopenhauer as Nietzsche's 'Great Teacher' and 'Antipode'". He describes how Nietzsche's approaches to philosophical problems still demonstrate Schopenhauer's influence, despite his disagreeing with Schopenhauer on "the issue of whether life is worth living" (163). Much of the essay investigates the relation between the will to power and Schopenhauer's metaphysics of the will. As Soll suggests, construing the will to power as a cosmological hypothesis and not merely as a psychological theory would come more naturally to a philosopher who grew up with Schopenhauer's metaphysics than to one who didn't. Soll argues that the psychological aspects of Nietzsche's theory are continuous with Schopenhauer's, concluding that "Nietzsche's psychological theory of the will to power should be viewed as a significant refinement of Schopenhauer's theory of the will to life, not a complete departure from it" (184). If Soll had engaged more with recent scholarship on the will to power, he could have helpfully added to those discussions.
Simon Robertson and David Owen discuss Nietzsche's influence on analytic philosophy, sensibly restricting their focus to moral philosophers who explicitly address Nietzsche. They begin by considering Philippa Foot's interest in Nietzsche's critique of values, and then discuss Charles Taylor, Alasdair MacIntyre, and Bernard Williams, who share Nietzsche's interest in evaluating transitions between moral outlooks. Robertson and Owen note many of the differences between these philosophers' historical approaches and Nietzsche's. They provide an interesting discussion of Foot's and Williams' classic papers, "Morality as a System of Hypothetical Imperatives" and "Internal and External Reasons", noting that both philosophers see morality as not providing reasons to all agents. I saw Williams as standing closer to Nietzsche's rejection of morality than Foot, whose arguments favor some forms of moral realism. If moral norms can apply to people without giving them reasons, as Foot notes that norms of etiquette can, moral realists can claim that they apply to everyone without having to explain how they provide categorical reasons. (As Nietzsche is more explicitly concerned with morality and values than with reasons, positioning him in debates about morality/reasons internalism is somewhat difficult.) The essay ends with an exploration of Brian Leiter's "Nietzsche and the Morality Critics", outlining a Nietzschean critique of obligation-centered moral theories.
Each of the next eight essays concerns one of Nietzsche's major works. Daniel Came considers Nietzsche's view in the Birth of Tragedy that illusion is necessary to make life tolerable, and argues against Bernard Reginster, Simon May, and others that this view persists into later works. Came presents Nietzsche's view that in tragedy, "the soul of the Greek spectator became healthy, through experience of the Dionysian within the protective realm of Apollonian illusion" (216). He attributes to Nietzsche a global anti-realism about value on which "all claims of the form 'X is valuable' are false" (220). He then argues that one achieves a favorable evaluation of the world by having a favorable conception of oneself, and advances a "pretence theory of the self" on which our capacity for illusion allows us to conceive ourselves as valuable (221). Came's interpretation has us wrapped in layers of fiction, pretending that there is value and that we have selves so we can pretend the world is valuable. I found Came's picture interesting despite being more attracted to interpretations on which selves are real things composed of drives, and value exists subjectively in things favored by our passions.
Keith Ansell-Pearson discusses the first three essays of the Unfashionable Observations (which he argues is a better translation than 'Untimely Meditations'). He claims that "there is a neglected unifying theme to them and . . . this centres on Nietzsche's commitment to the sublime" (226). He showed me that this was true of the first essay, where Nietzsche's criticism of cultivated philistines can be seen as grounded in their "jaded and egoistic" pursuit only of art that suits their smugness, rather than of "sublime masterworks." He discusses the third essay next, perhaps because the aforementioned dissatisfaction with modernity provides the background for how the Schopenhauerian view of humanity leaves more room for the sublime than typical modern views. Then he describes how Nietzsche's discussion of the monumentalist mode of historiography in the second essay expresses his commitment to the sublime. The antiquarian and critical modes seem harder for his interpretation to address, and aren't discussed at length. Even if Ansell-Pearson's claim about a "unifying theme" to the essays is overly strong, he raised my appreciation for how the sublime appears in these essays and elsewhere in Nietzsche's philosophy.
The Gay Science is a delightful but disunified book, making it impossible for anyone to write a unified essay discussing all of its exciting topics. Christopher Janaway's essay has many sections addressing the highlights of the book, including the death of God, problems with compassion, the eternal recurrence, whether Nietzsche wants us to confront truth or cover it with illusion, and the relation between art and truth. Through all of this he discusses a theme that runs through the book: how to reconcile the search for truth with the value of life. The result is a well-unified essay that makes sensible points about a wide range of interesting issues.
Gudrun von Tevenar notes that Nietzsche wrote Zarathustra in a different style from his other works and regarded it as his greatest achievement. She considers three ways Nietzsche described the book elsewhere: as tragedy, as establishing a counter-ideal to the ascetic ideal, and as parody. While acknowledging how it differs from conventional tragedies, she discusses how it opposes Apollonian and Dionysian themes in the manner Nietzsche saw as distinctive of tragedy. Her discussions of issues like Zarathustra's confrontation with his disgust at humanity help us understand central themes in the text, even if they don't provide a strong case for seeing it as a tragedy. Her treatment of the book as establishing a counter-ideal discusses an underappreciated theme in the text -- the difference between the kind of love Zarathustra praises and Christian love, which helps us appreciate how Zarathustra operates as a parody of Jesus. I was pleased to learn that brünstig, the term used to characterize Zarathustra's lust for the Eternal Return, is more typically used for male animals' desires toward females than for human sexual desires. If Zarathustra triumphs through animal lust for the Eternal Return, the ideal he embodies certainly is far from an ascetic one.
Maudemarie Clark and David Dudrick interpret Beyond Good and Evil as having a merely exoteric naturalist reading as well as an esoteric reading that tries to satisfy the "normative aspirations of traditional philosophy" (303). Fully defending this view is a book-length task that they've already performed, so they focus on sections 3 and 4. The puzzle motivating their reading comes from Nietzsche's remark in section 4 that "the falsity of a judgment is to us not necessarily an objection to a judgment." I didn't share their puzzlement. While pragmatic views of the value of belief like the one Nietzsche suggests there aren't widely accepted, the idea that believing something false might have pragmatic value is easy to understand. And while it's impossible to believe that p while acknowledging that p is false, this need not be explained by the norms governing belief. Standard functionalist views of belief permit believing that p while wishing one could realize pragmatic value by believing that not-p. (Clark and Dudrick may have relied too heavily on David Velleman's controversial views about how belief is constitutively governed by its aim.) Those more impressed with the puzzle than I are more likely to be impressed by their interpretation, on which Nietzsche's remarks about "falsity" merely mean that the judgments don't correspond to a standard beyond that of mankind.
Richard Schacht's "Nietzsche's Genealogy" pays detailed attention to issues of translation. Schacht begins with an argument for translating the title as "On the Genealogy of Morality", with understood scare quotes around 'Morality'. (He argues for each part independently, but doesn't actually assemble the words into a full title.) He notes that Nietzsche doesn't actually use the word 'Genealogy' often within the essays, suggesting that he may have put the word in the title simply because he appreciated good titles. This would make it unlikely that Nietzsche is using the term to refer to a historical approach of which he had a precise conception. Schacht then addresses the three essays of the Genealogy. A common thread in his interpretations of the first two essays is the Lamarckian way in which later generations inherited earlier generations' characteristics -- in the first essay the intuitive sense for slave morality, and in the second essay the memory of the will that is essential for bad conscience. As Schacht's discussion of the third essay suggests, Nietzsche's criticism of how the ascetic ideal promotes the value of truth doesn't imply a rejection of truth, and allows truth to have value in some other way.
Dylan Jaggard treats the Antichrist as providing a more historical background to the psychological story in the Genealogy. His discussion of the biblical scholar Julius Wellhausen, who seems to have been Nietzsche's source for the history of the Jews, is particularly helpful. While Nietzsche doesn't himself present proper historical evidence for his claims, he appears to be relying on Wellhausen's 362-page Prolegomena to the History of Ancient Israel. That Nietzsche cared to make sure his claims fit existing historical accounts (even if he didn't cite them) suggests that he saw his own historical accounts as factual rather than fictional.
Christa Davis Acampora's discussion of Ecce Homo describes how Nietzsche regards individuals as "conglomerates of multiple, competing drives, affects, and thoughts" (367). She describes Nietzsche's Kriegs-Praxis, in which the organization of drives that constitute him maintain themselves so that he can fight for the things he most deeply cares about, rather than fighting less significant obstacles. Nietzsche's remarks about the importance of various places for his writing fit her interpretation nicely. This essay was the last to focus on an individual work. The authors tasked with doing so managed to provide helpful information, despite the difficulties of writing unified essays on works that go in so many directions.
The next seven essays concern Nietzsche on values. Nadeem Hussain may be foremost among Nietzsche scholars in applying the categories of contemporary metaethics to help us understand Nietzsche's views about the nature of value. His knowledge of the area is evident in the clear and accurate way "Nietzsche's Metaethical Stance" lays out the possible views. He considers textual evidence for error theory, revolutionary fictionalism, subjectivism, noncognitivism, and also the possibility that Nietzsche had no determinate metaethical view. While he has argued elsewhere for revolutionary fictionalism, he is more evenhanded here, apart from some sensible points about the difficulties facing noncognitivist interpretations.
In "Nietzsche and the Arts of Life", Aaron Ridley begins by noting the importance of existence as "aesthetic phenomenon" for Nietzsche. He writes in the Birth of Tragedy that this is the only way "existence and the world are eternally justified", and in the Gay Science that this is how "existence is still bearable for us". This seems to be a weightier claim than that art and music add to the value of our lives, as Ridley notes. To better understand it, Ridley explores Nietzsche's views concerning aesthetic spectators of the divine, supposedly disinterested, and more honestly passionate varieties; the role of artists as giving form to things and producing honest illusions about their nature; and narrative, substantive, conscious, and unconscious self-creation. Unifying these reflections into a unified ideal is, as Ridley acknowledges, quite difficult.
Lanier Anderson's well-organized, well-argued, and clear "Nietzsche on Autonomy" is one of the best essays in the volume. It first considers free will, carefully evaluating Leiter's hard determinist interpretation and Clark and Dudrick's compatibilist interpretation. Anderson then considers (by my count) six conceptions of autonomous agency -- the desire-belief model, a model involving a transcendental self, the constitutivist view favored by Paul Katsafanas, a Frankfurt-style hierarchical model, an "expressivist theory of action" on which action renders "act and intention inseparable from one another" (452), and a view of autonomy as an ethical ideal. The evidence for attributing each to Nietzsche receives a thorough exploration. The expressivist view he considers has strange consequences. Anderson illustrates that view with the example of someone who wants "to write a good poem" but ends up writing a bad poem, leading us to "adjust our characterization of what the intention's content was all along to match the poem that is eventually produced" (452). So we say he intended all along to write a bad poem, and succeeded in doing so? Honest failure then seems to be impossible. But Anderson soon picks up on this, noting that the view makes even the ascetic and the Last Man successful agents. All in all, this is an excellent essay.
Early in "The Overman", Randall Havas writes: "I do not, however, aim to provide an interpretation of the use Nietzsche makes of the idea of an overman in Thus Spoke Zarathustra" (462). With this distance from the main text in which the overman appears (not just in the famous Prologue, but in twelve other sections), we can't get an accurate picture of the title character of the essay. The essay instead presents a broadly Heideggerian view of agency in relation to time. Havas calls the overman "someone who has overcome his human, all-too-human resistance to the temporal character of agency by taking responsibility for the choices he makes" (480). Such a person has no ill will towards the constraints of the past or unexpected future events. Even if we have no reason to think he represents the overman of Zarathustra, he's an interesting agent.
In "Order of Rank", Robert Guay argues that the "problem of order of rank" concerns "how there can be normative authority at all" (487). On Guay's view, "order of rank is grounded as a constitutive condition" for the possibility of value (504). Guay defends this "Transcendental" interpretation against the "Natural Aristocracy, Mythic Archaism, Political, and Anthropological" interpretations, which he declines to locate in the scholarly literature (486). Some of these interpretations seemed to address different value-related issues rather than being genuinely competing views about a unified topic. Guay rightly concludes that Nietzsche didn't have a developed theory of "order of rank". Perhaps Nietzsche didn't consistently mean anything specific and unified by that phrase.
Mark Migotti writes about the sovereign individual and promising. He sees Nietzsche as interested in self-committing speech-acts like threats and vows, as well as promises. I liked his discussion of how Nietzsche grounds the normative significance of promissory fidelity in the promiser rather than in the promisee. He concludes with an argument that Nietzsche holds the sovereign individual in high esteem, bolstered by an impressive sensitivity to Nietzsche's German. He and Leiter may each be right about what they care most about in this debate, with Nietzsche esteeming the sovereign individual as Migotti says, and the sovereign individual's psychology being fully naturalistic and fatalistic as Leiter says.
Jacob Golomb argues that Nietzsche's philosophy doesn't support fascism or the Nazi regime. Many of us learned this from Walter Kaufmann long ago, and Golomb has additional arguments. He distinguishes Nietzsche's use of Macht (power) from Kraft (force) and Gewalt (violence), undermining readings on which the will to power is a drive for power over others. He attributes to Nietzsche "an ideal picture of an entire culture driven by powerful individuals -- generous, independent, unprejudiced, endowed with the ability to perform a creative sublimation of instincts", which seems basically right (539). Perhaps Nietzsche could've been convinced to support whatever government would fit that culture, and would let democratically elected politicians set interest rates and maintain sewers, leaving the Stendhals and Goethes free to do the creative work he really cared about.
The section on epistemology and metaphysics begins with Ken Gemes' wonderfully clear article on perspectivism. He first considers several formulations of the view, with excellent arguments against stronger ones. Rejecting weaker formulations because Nietzsche is "a philosopher who does not seem generally to deal in such trivialities" (559) didn't seem quite as good. Everybody makes weak claims sometimes. On Gemes' own psychobiological view, drives have perspectives that they seek to express, and the healthiest life maximally expresses the richest set of drives. This view fits many of Nietzsche's remarks, especially in his unpublished writings. Even if Nietzsche didn't publish the formulations that best fit this interpretation, perhaps because he wasn't fully confident in them, Gemes lays out a clear and distinctive view that strongly attracted him.
Brian Leiter's contribution defends his naturalistic interpretation from a variety of objections. He argues against Janaway that Nietzsche's broadly Humean project of developing a naturalistic human psychology is "detachable in principle" from the style through which he hopes to change us, just as psychology can be studied separately from the practical details of how to implement it in therapy. This is quite sensible -- while Nietzsche's many styles create a variety of interpretive challenges and opportunities, they shouldn't prevent us from locating Nietzsche on the map of philosophical positions. Particularly interesting are Leiter's discussions of causation, where naturalistically inclined philosophers disagree significantly amongst themselves, and the metaphysical treatment of the will to power, which is far from any sort of naturalism. On the will to power, Leiter joins Clark in hoping that "the crackpot metaphysics is really presented in an ironic spirit" (594). I favor a more concessive naturalistic interpretation: after his early fondness for Schopenhauer, a metaphysics of the will retained some appeal for Nietzsche, and he tried to synthesize it with his naturalistic psychological views. But none of his syntheses satisfied him, precisely for naturalistic reasons. So he left his most confident expressions of the "crackpot metaphysics" in the scrap paper of his notes.
Sebastian Gardner "understands Nietzsche's notion of aesthetic justification in terms of a lateral relation of rational integration between aesthetic consciousness and philosophical reflection" (600). Central to his interpretation is the "Aesthetic State", described by Nietzsche as composed of sexual drive, intoxication, and cruelty: "the mixture of these very delicate nuances of animal well-being and desires is the aesthetic state" (613). I didn't see how Gardner's contention that the Aesthetic State is integrated with reason and "is not an immediate effect of our corporeal animal nature" fits with Nietzsche's description of art as "on the one hand a surplus and overflow of flourishing corporeality into the world of images and wishes; on the other, a rousing of the animal function" (614). But the Kant-influenced terminology of his essay is difficult, and perhaps he explained this in a way I couldn't understand.
Robin Small's essay, "Being, Becoming, and Time in Nietzsche", also discusses knowledge and life. It presents pre-Socratic philosophy as a background for "How the 'True World' Became a Fable". Small uses Nietzsche's Basel lectures to show how he understood the pre-Socratics' views of being and becoming. I wish I understood these two notions. (Using conceptual analysis, philosophers have deconstructed the binary opposition between being and becoming, distinguishing between existence, identity, stillness, permanence, necessity, and truth.) I recommend the essay to those who understand these terms, as Small's presentation is otherwise clear enough that not much else confuses me.
Paul Loeb's "Eternal Recurrence" uses impressive textual discoveries to support daring hypotheses. He uses the textual continuities between the death of Socrates in GS 340 and the appearance of the demon in GS 341 to argue that Nietzsche genuinely regards the eternal recurrence as "a reality that is revealed at the moment of death" (650). Both he and I admire the arguments for the doctrine offered in Zarathustra. But I'd draw the weaker interpretive conclusion that the eternal recurrence may be true in the fictional world of Zarathustra, where there are also talking animals. Even so, those of us who shy away from Loeb's strong conclusions should strive to fit our weaker conclusions to the interesting data he discovers. I wish more scholars shared Loeb's appreciation for textual detail in Zarathustra and his clarity of writing. We'd know so much more about the book if they did.
The last four essays concern the will to power. Peter Poellner interprets Nietzsche as understanding causation in terms of powers rather than Humean regularities, seeing volition as the only causal power we're directly acquainted with, and giving an account of volition in terms of the will to power. Following classic arguments for panpsychism, Poellner has Nietzsche then understanding all causal powers, even in nature, as additional instances of the only causal power we're directly acquainted with: will to power! The argument has some textual support, especially in the unpublished writings, and it's pretty neat as an argument for an incredible conclusion. Poellner is right not to argue that Nietzsche was committed to this view, as parts of it fit badly with his other views. But he also seems right that Nietzsche seriously considered the argument.
Bernard Reginster discusses how Nietzsche sees the will to power explaining the emergence and character of Christian morality. He understands the will to power as an independent "desire for effective agency" that competes with other desires and drives (706). When this desire is unsatisfied, frustration results and ressentiment can develop. Reginster then explains many of the moral phenomena presented in the Genealogy as the manifestations of a frustrated will to power. While some interpreters locate the will to power in all motivation (and even causation) rather than seeing it as one motivational state among many, Reginster's impressively unified story demonstrates the interpretive fruitfulness of his approach. Perhaps there are so many fruitful approaches because Nietzsche couldn't unify all the things "will to power" meant to him.
Katsafanas begins by criticizing three conceptions of drives that all have textual support in Nietzsche, but which differ from each other and raise various philosophical difficulties: as homuncular agents, as dispositions, and as motivational states of which the agent is often unaware. On his view, drives are dispositions that induce affective orientations, which can then shape the agent's values and reflective thought. This interpretation might not account for Nietzsche's weirdest remarks favoring the homuncular conception, but it nicely describes the kind of mental state that fits within some of his best psychological explanations. As passions in Hume's philosophy and desires in some contemporary Humean theories play the same motivational, affective, thought-directing, and evaluative roles, Katsafanas' view may help us understand "drive" in the language of other theories, as a group of passions or desires that motivate the same type of activity.
The volume ends with "Nietzsche on Life's Ends", in which John Richardson discusses what Nietzsche means by "life" and its relation to value. Understanding the slogan "life is will to power" is a particular focus of the essay. I appreciated his helpful discussion of Zarathustra's encounters with the female-personified Life, who sometimes talks to him about the will to power. On Richardson's interpretation, life is identified with the "body values" embedded in our biological nature, which aim us at power. (Here I happily recalled Von Tevenar on Zarathustra's brünstig for Eternity.) Meanwhile, the "agent values" in the principles we acquire through social processes aim us at society's goal of making us behave as it wishes. Richardson's thoughtful and unpretentious exposition of Zarathustra made his essay a happy ending for an excellent volume.