This book is a significant contribution to the discussion on the problem of evil and global philosophy of religion. While the problem of evil for atheists is not new, e.g., Moreland and Craig (2003, 552) had argued that ‘If God does not exist, then we are locked without hope in a world filled with gratuitous and unredeemed suffering’, in no other book has this problem been explained in such a systematic, well-organized, and clear manner, covering both Western and Eastern religious perspectives.
In Chapters 1 and 2, Nagasawa distinguishes different versions of the problem of evil: Deductive Non-Probabilistic Version, Deductive Probabilistic Version, Inductive Version, and Abductive Version. He also distinguishes between the axiological approach, which understands evil in terms of the undesirability of pain, and the deontological approach, which understands evil in terms of the moral status of actions, such as whether one ought to do x or one ought not to do x (20). He notes different versions of theism (including the concept of ‘maximal God’, which affirms that God is the greatest possible being, yet not exactly omnipotent or exactly wholly good, which he considered in his earlier work) and states that the axiological problem of evil poses a challenge not only to traditional theism but also to alternative versions of theism, as well as atheism. The problem concerns ‘the apparent mismatch between our expectation that there is no evil in the actual world and our observation of the reality that there is evil’ (41).
Nagasawa proposes the following principle:
an argument against all is no argument against one. For example, if there is an argument that undermines physicalism, dualism, and idealism, then physicalists cannot undermine idealism by appealing to it. If I succeed in showing in the present book that the problem of evil arises for atheism/non-theism as well as traditional theism, then atheists/non-theists who reject traditional theism by appealing to the problem of evil violate this principle. (52)
Nagasawa would also argue in the rest of this book that ‘the problem of evil does not pose a more significant challenge for traditional theism than its alternatives because traditional theism enjoys greater advantages than its alternatives for developing a response to the problem’ (52).
In Chapter 3, Nagasawa explains the ‘divinity problem of evil’ for pantheists.
‘Pantheism says that the world is divine, yet our observation shows that there is evil of considerable quantity and quality in the world, which seems to be in conflict with divinity. Hence, there is a gap between pantheists’ axiological expectation of how the world should be and how it actually is’. (66)
‘While traditional theists may be able to avoid the divinity problem of evil by appealing to the ontological gap between God and the world…Pantheists cannot respond to the divinity problem of evil by making parallel responses. For instance, they cannot appeal to the free will theodicy because even if, as the theodicy says, evil is an outcome of the human misuse of morally significant freedom, humans themselves are, according to pantheists, part of God. Neither can pantheists appeal to the soul-making theodicy because they hold that there is no life beyond the spatiotemporal universe which humans currently inhabit. Neither can they appeal to sceptical theism because they do not believe in the existence of a personal God with a grand scheme’. (74)
Nagasawa also argues against multiverse pantheists by stating that they face evil that is more considerable in quantity and quality than traditional theists and standard pantheists do, since they ‘believe that all possible instances of evil, including the worst possible instances of evil, exist. This means that they believe that evil of the most extreme quality and quantity is realized and, moreover, is part of God’ (83-84). Nagasawa considers a number of possible responses and argues that they fail; for example, one problem with the proposal that the multiverse does not include all possible universes but all and only possible universes that are overall good is that ‘the multiverse does not have any comparable mechanism to filter out possible universes that are not overall good’ (88-89).
In Chapter 4, Nagasawa discusses axiarchism, which claims that the world exists because an abstract creatively effective ethical requirement’ necessitated its existence (58). The problem of axiological expectation mismatch is that ‘if axiarchism is necessarily true, then there should be no possible world that contains evil…because the principle guarantees that there is no evil in any possible world. Clearly, though, many possible worlds do contain evil’ (96). While traditional theists can argue that a personal God does not choose to create creatures because of their axiological values but because of his grace which extends to those who are unworthy and thus God does not have to actualize the best possible world, such an option is not accessible to axiarchists (105). Nagasawa notes that one might reformulate axiarchism and claim that ‘the creatively effective ethical requirement actualizes the best possible reality, which consists of all possible worlds that are overall good’ (108).
However, the problem is that ‘the creatively effective ethical requirement of axiarchism can actualize only a single, best possible reality, if not a single, best possible world, in the Leibnizian axiological hierarchy. Yet there seems no way to construe a reality, which is understood to consist of distinct possible worlds, as a single organic whole that the creatively ethical requirement can choose to actualize. There has to be some mechanism for binding distinct possible worlds to form a single reality. If there is a personal God, for example, then one could argue that distinct possible worlds are bound in a single reality through God’s psychological unity…This option is not available to axiarchism, however, because axiarchism does not postulate the existence of a personal being (with psychological states) like God’ (108-9).
In Chapters 5 to 8, Nagasawa explains the problem of systemic evil, which focuses on a biological system for which humans are not responsible, such as the system of natural selection and evolution (124). Nagasawa also proposes a particular version of modest optimism, which states that ‘overall and fundamentally, the environment in which we exist is not bad’ (142). He argues that this optimism ‘is so modest that most people, including most atheists and other non-theists, are likely to accept it’ (145), although there have been pessimists such as Arthur Schopenhauer and David Benatar who reject it (142-6). Nagasawa then argues that ‘there are many non-theists, such as axiarchists, Platonists, and pantheists, whose views imply modest optimism’ and that ‘there are psychological reasons to think that most atheists/non-theists endorse modest optimism’ (153).
‘However, our observation of systemic evil suggests that it is not the case that our environment is, overall and fundamentally, not bad…Hence, modest optimists face an axiological expectation mismatch’ (155). Nagasawa does not regard this problem as a successful argument for showing the falsity of either traditional theism or atheism but as a challenge (177). He argues that traditional theists are better situated than atheists to respond to the challenge because they can appeal to their resources concerning God and the afterlife.
‘On the other hand, atheists/nontheists cannot borrow this response because they do not share theistic resources…all they can do then is hope that, overall and fundamentally, our environment is not bad. Hence, atheists/non-theists cannot be as confident as traditional theists about the truth of modest optimism’. (190)
Nagasawa notes that ‘while non-cognitivism may allow atheists/non-theists to avoid the problem of systemic evil, it also precludes them from endorsing modest optimism. Therefore, the proposed approach does not help atheists/non-theists who wish to defend modest optimism’ (187). He also notes that critics might argue that the problem of systemic evil only poses a challenge for modest optimist atheists but not pessimists (186). In response, Nagasawa notes that pessimism ‘carries significant existential implications which many would find morally repugnant’, especially in relation to birth affirmation and procreation (188-9). Pessimism also entails difficulties with regards to the existential gratitude thesis, according to which it is appropriate that we feel pleased about and grateful for our existence in the environment in which we live (163), and with regards to maintaining a positive outlook for flourishing on a global scale. Others have argued that pessimism implies that life is absurd and that there is no good reason to believe that it is worthwhile on the whole (188).
In Chapters 9 and 10, Nagasawa discusses how Eastern traditions including Japanese medieval philosophers, Buddhists, and Hindus have addressed the ‘problem of impermanence’. Nagasawa argues that various responses such as hermetism, Hedonism, and ‘indifferentism’ are unsatisfactory and that any version of transcendentalism that might work requires ‘a supernaturalist ontology that allows us to affirm the existence of a reality that lies beyond impermanence’ (229).
This book contains many excellently argued pages in which Nagasawa patiently (although at times repetitiously) goes through in detail the possible responses which can be made on behalf of pantheism, axiarchism, atheism, and non-theism, and the problems with (most of) these responses. Nevertheless, one might have hoped that Nagasawa would evaluate the specific versions of transcendentalism in Eastern traditions, just as he had evaluated pantheism, etc. in earlier chapters; but Nagasawa says that he lacks the space to do this (229). This implies that Nagasawa has not demonstrated that there is a problem of evil for atheism (contrary to the title of this book) but only for naturalism, as there are millions of Buddhists who are regarded by Nagasawa as atheists, and yet, they affirm supernaturalism concerning reincarnation and nirvana. (Perhaps Nagasawa should have titled his book ‘The Problem of Evil for Naturalists’.) Nagasawa could have strengthened his argument by considering the works of scholars of Buddhism (e.g., Williams 2002) who have argued that there are problems with Buddhist views concerning reincarnation and nirvana.
Another shortcoming is that Nagasawa focuses on axiological rather than deontological problems because optimism is understood as an axiological thesis, and the axiological approach is more closely aligned with his attempt to develop versions of the problem of evil that apply to non-theists (135). Atheists might object that, even if traditional theism is better than atheism in addressing the axiological problem regarding optimism (as Nagasawa argues), nevertheless atheism is better than traditional theism when it comes to deontological problem because atheists do not believe in the existence of any significant moral agent that is comparable to God (135), and hence, do not face the problem. In which case, atheists who reject traditional theism by appealing to the deontological problem of evil do not in fact violate the principle ‘an argument against all is no argument against one’, which Nagasawa proposed on p.52.
Now, the atheist argument from deontological evil against theism can be answered (see Loke 2022, which also mentions the ‘resources’ of supernatural, evil entities such as fallen angels for explaining systemic evil), and one can also argue that traditional theism has better resources for providing a metaphysical grounding for deontological ethics (Loke 2023). But Nagasawa does not pursue these issues here. However, if Nagasawa intends to show that ‘with respect to grappling with the problem of evil, it seems that traditional theists can either win or draw while atheists/non-theists can at best draw but are more likely to lose’ (231), he should discuss both deontological and axiological problems and not axiological problem only. This criticism does not deny the fact that Nagasawa has done an important work on the axiological problem that highlights the existential difficulties facing naturalists.
REFERENCES
Loke Andrew. 2022. Evil, Sin, and Christian Theism. London: Routledge.
Loke, Andrew. 2023. ‘A new moral argument for the existence of God.’ International Journal for Philosophy of Religion 93:25-38.
Moreland, James Porter and William Lane Craig (2003). Philosophical Foundations for a Christian Worldview. Downers Grove, IL: IVP.
Williams, Paul. 2002. The Unexpected Way: On Converting from Buddhism to Catholicism. Edinburgh: T & T Clark.