The Rich and the Poor

Philip Kitcher has written a cri de couer lamenting the decline of the welfare states he recalls flourished in his native Britain in the 1950’s and 60’s. He begins by recounting the kindness of a schoolmaster who picked the seven-year old Philip out as a promising candidate for a selective school, an opportunity that changed his life. He expresses repugnance at the “free market” or neoliberal policies adopted by Margaret Thatcher and Ronald Reagan in the 1980s, and is appalled by the competitive spirit fostered by free market economic policies. Ethics has been banished from policy analysis and kindness has diminished, displaced by capitalism’s summum bonum of cheap consumer goods (118).

We have, in Kitcher’s view, inherited an “ethical catastrophe” (xiv). In his youth, says Kitcher, academics and government officials were not only confident that rich nations “have the obligation to spread their wealth and their expertise to aid the poor”, but they also “believed firmly in the…inevitability, of attaining the goal demanded by the obligations” (9). Kitcher’s book is an effort to revive the “large scale moral mission to give aid to those who have less” (xii). He says he is a “reformed moral idealist”, “attentive to the possibility of our own moral blindness” but confident that we can approximate forms of “ideal deliberation” and thereby “uncover difficulties in our current institutions” and devise solutions for them (152).

It is hard not to sympathize with Kitcher’s complaints: the stubborn persistence of poverty, the crassness of much commercial society, and the sharp rise in economic and political inequality, especially in the US. Few will deny that our politics and political economy need repair. But any sound analysis must take account of the many sources of disagreement and conflict, and the limits of moral motivation, in vastly diverse commercial societies like the US and the UK. Despite its noble intentions, this book pulls up short.

*****

Chapter 1, “The Erosion of Kindness”, depicts in broad brushstrokes the moral decline Kitcher sees as unfolding since the late 1970’s. While at first Kitcher’s main concern seemed to be social democratic welfare states, his moral egalitarianism is global in scope. He cites data from economist Branko Milanovic indicating that 44% of the global income gains over the period from 1988 to 2008 went to the richest 5%. That looks bad (27). On the other hand, as he also notes, roughly the middle 60% of the world’s population (in terms of income) saw cumulative income gains during that thirty-year period of between 40% and 80%. (26) As Kitcher reports, “Real income gains were greatest among people around the 50^th percentile of the global income distribution…and among the richest” 1% (26, caption to figure 1.1). That looks pretty good.

Kitcher allows that “during the past 60 years, there have been some improvements for some groups of people in some places…extreme poverty has declined”. Indeed, “a billion people have been rescued from struggling to live on less than a dollar a day” (12-13, emphasis in original). The actual figure is likely higher.^[1]

About the more hopeful statistics, Kitcher asks skeptically: “How large is the increase in daily income? How great is the difference in quality of life?” Have drowning people merely “been brought from 20 feet below the surface to only 15 feet under?” (13) In fact, with the greater material wellbeing, child mortality rates have plummeted, and adult longevity has increased, so hundreds of millions of lives have been saved and lengthened. The global picture seems brighter than Kitcher allows, especially if we care as much about the reductions in dire poverty as the increasing inequality.

In Chapter 2, “Rethinking Aid”, Kitcher acknowledges that “Donations to poor countries typically do not achieve their intended goals” (39) and that Western development projects have often smacked of neocolonialism (41). Nevertheless, Kitcher argues that we can do better. The “principal [aid supplying] foundations” now engage in deliberative and collaborative “partnerships” with beneficiaries that are “informed by local sensibilities” (41-42). Indeed, he repeatedly emphasizes the importance of partnerships with aid recipients, and warns of the “unthinking tendency to impose a form of life from without” (35).

In spite of that warning, Kitcher also asserts that “wise planning” requires a goal, a “concept of well-being” (35), a “large-scale architecture of the good” (55) to define what “cosmopolitan aid is to achieve” (43). Drawing on J.S. Mill, Amartya Sen, and Martha Nussbaum, he defends the “liberal conception of the quality of life” (57) and the “Capability Approach to human development”, whose central “organizing” and “suffusing” capability is to “choose your own good and to pursue it in your own way” (58, 64, 66, 71). “All young people should be “provided opportunities…to pursue whatever their dreams may be”: “your life should be your own”, to plan “reflectively and critically”. Education must enable people to have “highly developed faculties” so that future lives “are not, as most have been, ‘almost universally puerile and insignificant’” (57-58, quoting J.S. Mill). Also required of course are “adequate nutrition, safe shelter, and the ability to protect your health” (56-57). Policymakers should be attentive to local conditions and build “on the experiments that worked” in the past in order to devise “ambitious cosmopolitan programs” (72, 74).

If individual autonomy is a central aspect Kitcher’s “large-scale architecture of the good”, it is also a key component of his ideal of collective deliberation, which he regards as a “fully general” way of answering the question of what we ought to do: “Claims about what should be done and how it ought to occur must be endorsed, or overthrown, by the best version of an ideal deliberation we can contrive” (154).

The obvious question is: which takes priority, liberal autonomy or local traditions? Suppose aid recipients embrace cultures, traditions, and religious convictions that lead them to reject or qualify liberal autonomy’s “large scale architecture of the good”? Should aid agencies in that case try to educate them in the values and virtues of liberal autonomy and collective deliberation, so they can better answer the question, “what should be done?” I worry that there is a tension between emphasizing deliberative partnerships with aid recipients while proclaiming the apparently universal importance of liberal autonomy and announcing, as Mill and Kitcher do, that most people’s lives have been “puerile and insignificant”.

Chapter 3 continues the discussion of ideal collective deliberation, which Kitcher hopes can be a “method for ethical inquiry” (75) that can be “as reliable and as conducive to progress as those generated by” the scientific method (82-83). We need practices of “collective deliberation aimed at generating a resolution of some issue acceptable to all” (91). Deliberation needs to be “inclusive, well-informed, and, above all, mutually engaged” (91). Humans have the requisite capacities: Kitcher traces (as he has elsewhere) practices of empathetic collective deliberation to “hunter-gatherer bands of the Paleolithic [which] typically consisted of 40-70 members” (86). The key “function of morality is to amplify…our responsiveness to one another” (88, 90). Perfecting the model requires that participants should be “ideally responsive” to the perspectives of others, “informed by the best-established factual conclusions”, oriented toward seeking a “new way of behaving…tolerable by all” (90-1). Deliberative bodies must “collectively represent the perspectives of all those [sentient creatures] affected by the issue” (98). And room must be made for experts.

A tall order! Kitcher’s deliberative ideal is appealing but very rarely approximated in practice. As James Madison observed, “If Men were angels, no government would be necessary”. The sources of factional conflict are many, and “sown into the nature of man”: “So strong is this propensity of mankind to fall into mutual animosities, that where no substantial occasion presents itself, the most frivolous and fanciful distinctions have been sufficient to kindle their unfriendly passions and excite their most violent conflicts”.^[2] Political practice would seem to bear out Madison. And obviously, moral progress often occurs in conditions far short of the ideal. Kitcher rightly describes the abolition of slavery, the empowerment of women, and gay rights as “moral revolutions” (98 ff.). Women’s and gay rights were achieved through the flawed institutions of constitutional democracy, slavery in the US was finally vanquished on the battlefield. Do we most need more idealized forms of deliberation or a better appreciation for the actual workings of our flawed (but not hopeless) political institutions?

In any event, having developed his account of ideal deliberation, Kitcher turns in Chapter 4 to his descriptive analysis of a world that is “out of joint” (108). He argues that “the most blatant deficiencies in existing discussions of poverty” can be corrected if we become “more scrupulous about being inclusive and demanding evidence, and, especially, listening better to the narratives of people whose lives differ radically from our own” (110, emphasis in original). “The participants [in ethical inquiry] must engage with one another, attempting to see the world through others’ eyes and to feel it through their skins” (110). Noble sentiments, which might seem to caution against too readily dismissing most people’s lives as “puerile and insignificant”.

In his closing chapter, “Nothing to be Done?” Kitcher advocates experimenting with representative and deliberative forums that have become familiar among academics: citizen juries and deliberative polling, including of the sorts long advocated by James Fishkin and more recently by Alex Guererro and Helene Landemore (157-62). Acknowledging the current challenges of scaling-up such experiments (145), Kitcher argues that we need to inculcate “norms of empathetic deliberation” via schooling. Freedom “requires the social structures enabling you to make wise choices” (120). Education should train students to “enter into the perspectives of others”, encouraging “solidarity, citizenship, ethical inquiry, and ethical life” (147).

But what, Kitcher asks, is to be done “before the golden age of empathetic citizens?” Which is to say, given the citizens we have as opposed to those we hope for? “In the short term the probability that a deliberation will degenerate into displays of social domination can be reduced by judicious filtering of the participants” (147-148).

In case the reader missed his endorsement of “judicious” exclusion, Kitcher repeats it 15 pages later: ideal deliberation requires that participants “conform to high cognitive standards”, and it depends on cultivating the “affective dimensions of engagement among citizens”. “Deliberation must aim for mutual understanding, for a sympathetic entry into the lives of others. To the extent that is achieved, greater consensus becomes likely” (161-162). But again, what to do in the meantime, before the desirable cognitive and affective qualities have been instilled? “Before they are in place”, says Kitcher, “my approach will also favor a preliminary screening in which likely participants are chosen” (162).

It turns out that Kitcher’s empathetic insistence on “listening better” and entering “into the perspectives of others” has several sorts of limits. With respect to the Thatcher-Reagan market reforms, he goes beyond criticism to caricature, calling them part of a “hysteria” supported by the thought that it is “better by far to forget ethics entirely” (108-9). In addition, he judges that “appeals to certain kinds of authorities, including allegedly divinely inspired texts, must be prohibited” (103). With a sweeping, Deweyan comprehensiveness, Kitcher asserts that, “Gods who insist on precise ways in which they must be celebrated” and ask for blind obedience “are not worth worshipping” (104-105). Kitcher is confident that his preferred “methodology of ethical inquiry” is “what religion—at its best—proposes” (107).

*****

I agree with Kitcher’s desire for well-regulated markets and a fairer sharing of the gains of economic and social cooperation, but doubt that these causes are advanced by disparaging increased material prosperity as he is prone to do.

I agree with Kitcher on the value of experimenting with deliberative and participatory forums, but we should not harbor illusions about the prospects for transcending the many sources of deep diversity and conflict in politics. Democracy in practice, as opposed to theory, means cooperating with the fellow citizens we have, not those we might hope for.

We also need more clarity than Kitcher offers on domestic and global egalitarianism, and their comparative moral grounds. Should we care most about reducing poverty globally? Is income and wealth inequality of greater concern domestically than internationally? I’d answer “yes” to both questions (broadly speaking), but Kitcher doesn’t address them.

Social democracy declined for a number of reasons. The combination of high inflation and unemployment in the 1970’s undermined the Keynesian consensus. The “industrial working class peaked in size by 1970” and then “experienced a precipitous decline”.^[3] In the parties of the left, working class voters have been displaced by members of the educated and professional classes: what Thomas Piketty has called the “Brahmin Left”. With the dominance of educated elites has come a shift in the left’s priorities, described by Ruy Texeira as “neo-racialism” (or racial equity rather than color-blindness), mass immigration (including tolerance toward high rates of undocumented immigration), gender ideology, and climate catastrophism. Elite class bias (and blindness) played an important role in the policy response to Covid, in particular the prolonged school closures in the US with dire consequences for children from poorer backgrounds.^[4] Educated elites need to develop a livelier appreciation of their own blind spots.

As Robert Talisse has recently observed, “We are quick to see polarization and extreme thinking in our policy opponents. It is naïve to think that we are not vulnerable to the same forces that we routinely cite when diagnosing the other side” (2024, 442).^[5] 

REFERENCES

James Madison, The Federalist No. 10.

James Madison, The Federalist No. 51.

Ruy Texeira, “The Long Slow Death of Social Democracy” (www.commonplace.org, June 14, 2026).

Stephen Macedo and Frances Lee, In Covid’s Wake: How Our Politics Failed Us (2025).

Robert Talisse, “Depolarization Without Reconciliation,” Critical Review (2024) v. 35 (4): 426-449.