The Road to Paradox

This book is a thorough and detailed journey through a complex landscape: theories of truth and modality in languages that allow for self-referential sentences. As is well known, such languages are prone to paradoxes, and the book explores the main results in the field within classical logic. The literature on these topics is vast, but the book distinguishes itself on two important grounds: (1) The usual approaches formalize truth and provability as predicates, and the modal notions (e.g., necessity, knowledge, belief, etc.) as propositional operators. This book develops a unified account in which all these notions are formalized as predicates. (2) In the analysis of truth and provability, standard approaches use some appropriate theory of arithmetic as the basis to formalize the syntactic properties of the language via some codification of its expressions into natural numbers. In contrast, this book employs a theory of syntax based on a direct axiomatization of a theory of expressions that dispenses with arithmetic, thereby simplifying the metamathematical results.

The book is divided into twelve chapters. The dependencies among them are indicated at the preface to allow for different reading strategies depending on the reader’s interests. After two introductory chapters, Chapter 3 is devoted to the defense of point (1) mentioned above. Here, the authors compare the formalization of modal notions as operators and predicates. On the one hand, predicates can give rise to paradoxes, involve complex philosophical questions regarding their bearers (sentences, propositions, etc.), and do not have a rich semantics like that of standard possible worlds.

On the other hand, operators lack the expressive power that predicates afford. One example discussed by the authors is the statement “all analytic truths are necessary”. The natural way of formalizing this sentence with predicates would read “∀x (An x & Tr x → Nec x)”. However, formalizing the same statement using operators would be complicated by the presence of truth and the need to quantify over propositions. The authors consider—but do not develop—a mixed approach in which truth and provability are considered as predicates, while the other modal notions are considered as operators. This would yield the formalization “∀x (A Tr x → N Tr x)”, where “A” and “N” are now the operators of analyticity and necessity, respectively.^[1] 

In Chapter 7, the authors explore what a possible-worlds semantics might look like for the predicate of necessity if it were added to a propositional language with a single atomic proposition, but with the syntactic resources necessary for quoting its own expressions. They construct models consisting of a frame, an interpretation for the necessity predicate, and a valuation for the atomic proposition. The syntactic operators have a fixed interpretation since they are considered logical constants. Notice that, as with any predicate, necessity must be interpreted in the model as a set of sentences. For the intended models of the language—called PW-models—the interpretation of the necessity predicate respects the standard characterization of necessity as truth at all accessible worlds. Paradoxes are then used to prove limitative results showing that entire classes of frames cannot have PW-models. For instance, no reflexive frame can admit a PW-model, thereby excluding all modal systems that extend T.

One may think that this modal semantics suffers from serious limitations when compared to the standard semantics, and that a more promising approach would involve the mixed language mentioned above that restricts predicates to truth and provability, treating all other modal notions as operators. Be that as it may, the authors prove in this chapter a general theorem (the Strong Characterization Theorem), which characterizes the frames that can have a PW-model. By definition, a frame is converse well-founded if, and only if, every non-empty subset of worlds contains a maximal element with respect to the accessibility relation.

The Strong Characterization Theorem establishes that a frame admits a PW-model on every valuation if, and only if, it is converse well-founded. This result points out to converse non-well-foundedness as a general source of semantic paradoxes rather than strict self-reference or circularity. This is a significant result: it opens new ways to compare and classify paradoxes and should have significant repercussions for the assessment of their possible solutions.

Chapters 5 and 8 develop the theory of expressions referred to in point (2) above. The language of the theory in Chapter 8 is constructed from a finite number of basic symbols. Only these symbols have individual constants denoting them in the language. The language includes the functions of quotation and concatenation, allowing the formation of names for other expressions of the language. Since an expression is a string of symbols, the name of an expression is, roughly speaking, the concatenation of the quotation of its individual symbols. Additionally, auxiliary symbols are introduced to represent sequences of formulas in the language.

The theory developed in Chapter 5 is weaker than that of Chapter 8. The former is nonetheless still strong enough to prove the diagonal lemma and therefore sufficient to prove the main results concerning self-referential paradoxes in Chapter 6. The most well-known of these paradoxes are derived from expansions of the basic theory of expressions: the Liar Paradox, Montague’s paradox, and their connections to important theorems like Tarski’s indefinability of truth, McGee’s theorem on Tarskian biconditionals, Gödel’s incompleteness theorems, and Löb’s theorem. The chapter also discusses lesser-known paradoxes like that of Horsten and Leitgeb, which arises from the interaction of modalities in temporal logic. A particularly interesting section is devoted to Yablo’s and Visser’s paradoxes, which confirm the analysis in Chapter 7, namely, that converse ill-foundedness is the source of paradoxicality. The chapter concludes by showing how arithmetic can be formalized within the theory of expressions—by coding natural numbers as special expressions—and how this allows for a proof of McGee’s ω-inconsistency theorem.

The strong theory of expressions in Chapter 8 is used in Chapters 9 and 10 to formalize the provability predicate and to prove Gödel’s incompleteness results, along with Rosser and Löb’s theorems. In Chapter 9, the authors prove the consistency of the theory of expressions from Chapter 8 by constructing a standard model using the expressions of the language. They show how to axiomatize denotation and prove that Peano Arithmetic is a subtheory of the strong theory of expressions, further developing the translation introduced in Chapter 6.

Chapter 10 formalizes syntax within the theory of expressions. This culminates in the construction of the formula representing provability in simple expansions of the theory of expressions (where simple means that their set of axioms is pointwise expressed by a Δ-formula).^[2] The chapter goes on to prove Gödel’s incompleteness theorems and related results (including the Rosser variant and Löb’s theorem).

Chapter 11 returns to the theory of truth and presents—in a compact form—results concerning two forms of truth predicates additions to a language: (i) by a formula of the language that defines the predicate; or (ii) by a set of axioms that govern it. Regarding (i), the authors show how to define truth predicates for classes of formulas with reduced syntactic complexity.

As for (ii), they first present the usual, typed axiomatic systems—systems that apply truth to sentences in which the truth predicate does not occur—which include the theory of Tarskian biconditionals, the compositional theory of truth, and several variants thereof. They then go on to analyze untyped, axiomatic systems—systems in which the truth predicate can be applied to any sentence in the language, including those that themselves involve the truth predicate. Among this latter category are the Kripke-Feferman theory—which formalizes the set of true sentences in Kripke’s minimal fixed-point for truth—and the Friedman-Sheard theory—which is connected to validities in Gupta and Belnap’s revision theory of truth.

The book concludes in Chapter 12 with a discussion of a philosophical problem that is both important and surprisingly underexplored in the literature on paradoxes. This problem has to do with the adequacy of the formal counterparts of concepts such as provability, truth or self-reference. Formalizations of these concepts are typically evaluated in a purely intuitive way, with no clear criteria to judge their adequacy other than intuition. As the authors point out, this is problematic when attempting to generalize results based on these concepts. Such generalizations often involve the expectation that the result will remain valid under the substitution of one formalization of a concept with another that is extensionally equivalent. (The notion of extensional equivalence varies depending on the concept.) Any notion of extensional equivalence implies a classification of the results into extensional and intensional, depending on whether or not the result is preserved under extensional equivalence.

The authors argue that, in the case of provability, a compelling notion of extensional equivalence is pointwise equivalence. Given an expansion of the strong theory of expressions, two formulas are pointwise equivalent when one is provable in the theory if, and only if, the other is. They identify three possible sources of intensionality: differences in the coding of expressions, differences in the formal expression of properties and relations, and differences in how self-reference is expressed.

One of the advantages of their theory of expressions is that it substantially reduces the first type of intensionality. Regarding the second source, the authors introduce two principles to guide the formalization of properties. The first is the Resemblance Condition: a formula ϕ(x) expresses a property P of expressions if, and only, if ϕ(x) resembles the definition of P in the relevant way. For instance, the formalization of the provability predicate is considered adequate because it resembles the definition of provability done informally in the metalanguage.

The second is the Meaning-Postulate Condition: a formula ϕ(x) expresses a property P of expressions if, and only if, the theory proves all the meaning postulates for the property P for ϕ(x). For instance, one could argue that compositional axioms for truth—axioms that show that truth interacts appropriately with the logical operators—are meaning postulates that adequate theories of truth should incorporate. The authors use these principles to discuss the adequacy of some of the provability and truth predicates discussed in the book.

The chapter concludes with an analysis of the intensionality arising from self-reference. The authors propose as a necessary condition for being self-referential with respect to a property expressed by a formula ϕ(x) the condition of being a diagonal sentence for ϕ(x), i.e., being a sentence ψ such that the theory proves ψ ↔ ϕ (<ψ>)). This condition is not sufficient because some diagonal sentences have no intuitive connection whatsoever with self-reference. For example, the Tarskian biconditional for any sentence ϕ makes ϕ a diagonal sentence of the truth predicate. The authors define a result as extensional with respect to self-reference exactly when it holds for all diagonal sentences. This ensures that extensionality holds for all self-referential sentences.

The authors analyze intensionality results with respect to Henkin sentences, i.e., sentences that state their own provability. They show that, using a fixed provability predicate one can obtain provable and refutable Henkin sentences by varying the way in which the diagonal sentence is constructed, thereby obtaining an intensional case of self-reference. They also show that the Henkin sentence for the canonical provability predicate is provable. By using a different provability predicate (pointwise equivalent to the canonical one), however, one can obtain a refutable Henkin sentence, in both cases generating the Henkin sentence with the canonical diagonal construction. This is a case of intensionality due to the expression of the provability predicate. Another intriguing result is obtained with truth-tellers of truth predicates for Σ₁-sentences. Using the canonical diagonal construction applied to three predicates that pointwise express truth for Σ₁-sentences, the authors obtain three truth tellers: one is provable, one is refutable and the third is independent of the theory (in this case, the theory of compositional truth).

We believe that these theorems, along with the accompanying analysis, should be well-known and discussed by logicians and philosophers working on semantic paradoxes. We would also like to point out that readers who are not primarily interested in the more technical developments of the book can read the first six chapters, along with Chapter 12, without any loss of understanding. In our view, these chapters, together with Chapter 7, contain the philosophical core of the book and are perfectly accessible to non-expert readers.

In Chapter 3 on p. 25, the authors state that “the main purpose of this book is the development of a formal framework that can be fruitfully applied to many questions and problems”. We think that this aim has been completely fulfilled and that the conceptual tools provided will be highly useful to anyone working in truth theory, provability theory, or self-referential languages.