The Schopenhauerian Mind

The Schopenhauerian Mind reflects the recent surge of interest in Arthur Schopenhauer’s philosophy and its influence on modern thought. The volume is divided into five main sections and includes thirty-eight chapters. The first three sections focus on Schopenhauer’s core philosophical domains: epistemology (“Part I: Knowledge and Reality”), aesthetics (“Part II: Aesthetics and the Arts”), and ethics (“Part III: Ethics, Politics, and Salvation”).

The collection offers some stimulating discussions of Schopenhauer’s thought, making it relevant for anyone interested in his philosophy. Yet, it is not without limitations. The final two sections (“Part IV: Before Schopenhauer” and “Part V: After Schopenhauer”) comprise roughly 42 percent of the total work. This disproportionate focus on Schopenhauer’s connections and influence in European thought comes at the expense of a fuller treatment of his metaphysics—arguably the backbone of his system. Schopenhauer was a system builder whose ethical and aesthetic views are inseparable from his metaphysics. The volume, however, offers few satisfactory analyses of these interconnections.

Notably, apart from Manja Kisner’s essay, the term “metaphysics” is absent from all section and chapter titles. Part I opens with Douglas McDermid’s “Realism and Its Discontents”, devoted to Schopenhauer’s rejection of metaphysical realism—the view that objects and properties exist independently of perception. McDermid attributes to Schopenhauer the following five theses:

T.1: The view that physical objects are mind-independent is not self-evident.
T.2: If metaphysical realism is true, then we can know only appearances, not things in themselves.
T.3: We cannot conceive of a mind-independent empirical world of objects apart from subjects.
T.4: Metaphysical realism conflicts with our a priori recognition of causality.
T.5: Metaphysical realism conflicts with our a priori recognition of space and time.

McDermid’s attribution of these theses to Schopenhauer warrants clarification. He claims that for Schopenhauer, “far from being unknowable, the thing-in-itself […] is identical with what human beings apprehend in self-consciousness as will” (19). This is indeed the most natural and standard way of reading Schopenhauer. But the most natural reading is not always the right one, and I think that this is the case here. Substantial textual evidence suggests that Schopenhauer gradually shifted from an absolute identification of the thing-in-itself with will to a more qualified view.^[1] At times, he presupposes the mind-dependent nature of experience and will as the inner essence of phenomena, yet also admits “a reality beyond the will”, an actualizing principle of existence independent of consciousness (WWR II, Ch. XVIII, 198). Furthermore, McDermid asserts that “without idealism, Schopenhauer has no system” (18, original emphasis) but leaves unspecified the type of idealism in question. As Bernard Reginster observes, “although [Schopenhauer] officially continues to endorse transcendental idealism, his deep philosophical instincts would pull him away from it in the direction of some sort of realism”.^[2]

In Ch. 3, “Schopenhauer’s Metaphysical Two-aspect Account of the World and the Will to Life”, Manja Kisner argues that Schopenhauer employs two methods to understand the will: an “introspective method” or “philosophical psychology”, grounded in immediate, nonconceptual awareness of willing through pleasure and pain, and a “philosophical physiology” that relies on empirical observation and analogy (40). Kisner claims that Schopenhauer extends the will to nature analogically: “[…] Schopenhauer does not argue that we have direct knowledge of the will as the principle of everything—it is only through analogy with our own experience that we can come to this conclusion […]” (45).

Kisner, however, overstates the role of analogy in Schopenhauer’s metaphysics. Analogy establishes similarity, not identity. When Schopenhauer declares that ‘the world is identical to my will’, he means strict, not analogical, identity. Likewise, when he claims that “all things in the world are the objectivity of one and the same will, and consequently identical according to their inner nature” (WWR I §27), his point is ontological, not analogical. In Ch. 4, Timothy Stoll makes a similar observation in “Schopenhauer’s Theory of Science”: “Mere analogizing cannot grant the understanding we seek […]. Schopenhauer’s vitalist interpretation of force is not a case of mere analogizing” (62).

Yet Stoll’s comparison of Schopenhauer with vitalism needs qualification. The vis vitalis is a superseded scientific hypothesis that posits a mystical life-force irreducible to physical or chemical processes. Schopenhauer, by contrast, denies that will is confined to living organisms or that it is mystical. The will, as the most immediate reality, links all existence—organic and inorganic. Thus, he cannot be classed as a vitalist in the traditional sense. Nowhere in the entire volume is there any reference to an alternative to the kind of analogical reading advanced by Kisner.^[3]

In Ch. 6, Alexander S. Sattar characterizes Schopenhauer’s metaphysics as “pragmatic” rather than empirical or transcendental. On this view, Schopenhauer’s system is less reliant on a priori certainty and more dependent on “relative truths” and “a good deal of guesswork” and error (88). The interpretation is intriguing but unconvincing. Numerous passages in Schopenhauer’s writings contradict this portrayal. For Schopenhauer, the forms of space, time, and causality, as well as mathematical and logical principles, are a priori.^[4] Jens Lemanski’s discussion of Schopenhauer’s lecture notes on logic and mathematics (Ch. 2) helpfully underscores this, highlighting his “intuitionist philosophy of mathematics”, or “the imaginability or constructability a priori of geometric objects” (26).

Other essays in Part I include Steven P. Lydon’s study of Schopenhauer’s musical theory (Ch. 5), João Constâncio’s analysis of boredom, death, and the ideality of time (Ch. 7), and Anthony K. Jensen’s nuanced argument that history constitutes a special form of Wissen but not a Wissenschaft (Ch. 8).

Part II, in my view, is the strongest section. It features comprehensive and insightful discussions of Schopenhauer’s aesthetics. Bart Vandenabeele examines Schopenhauer’s conception of human beauty (Ch. 10), Peter Poellner explores nostalgic imagination (Ch. 11), and Sandra Shapshay investigates the relationship between moral and aesthetic value, arguing that for Schopenhauer art lacks transformative moral power (Ch. 14).

Nevertheless, this section, too, appears almost metaphysics-averse. In Ch. 9, Michel-Antoine Xhignesse asks, “To what extent is it appropriate to separate [Schopenhauer’s] aesthetics from his metaphysics?” (127). Xhignesse claims that “Schopenhauer’s reflections on aesthetics seem to speak to an experience artists have when they’re creating, even if his metaphysics doesn’t” (128), suggesting that, aside from Wagner, artists have been indifferent to Schopenhauer’s metaphysics. This appears implausible to me. Music, for Schopenhauer, is metaphysically distinct from representational art—it directly mirrors the will and reveals human nature through emotion. Many composers—Brahms, Mahler, and Schoenberg among them—appear drawn to this insight. Still, Xhignesse contends that artists are reluctant to “concede that music copies the Will!” (137).

“Music is an unconscious exercise in metaphysics in which the mind does not know it is philosophizing”, Schopenhauer famously writes (WWR I §52). In Ch. 13, Andrew Huddleston observes that “Schopenhauer […] admits that his theory of musical metaphysics is not verifiable” (194) and argues that music need not reveal metaphysical truth. While Huddleston’s critique is perceptive, it overlooks Schopenhauer’s alternative, analogical justification. Schopenhauer acknowledges that music “is in time alone without any reference to space” (WWR II, Ch. XXXIX, 453), and therefore, uniquely represents the will: “[…] others speak only of the shadow, but music of the essence” (WWR I §52). Schopenhauer often employs analogical inference to provide plausible evidence for phenomena that are otherwise difficult to explain. His metaphysical insight into music—an insight that resists abstract conceptualization—becomes more accessible and intelligible through the use of analogy:

I have devoted my mind entirely to the impression of music in its many different forms; and then I have returned again to reflection […] and have arrived at an explanation of the inner essence of music, and the nature of its imitative relation to the world, necessarily to be presupposed from analogy. (WWR I, §52)

He further observes that “the same will that objectifies itself both in the Ideas and in music”, and therefore, “an analogy between music and the Ideas” can “make easier, as an illustration, an understanding of [his theory], which is difficult because of the obscurity of the subject” (WWR I, §52).

Patrick Hassan’s essay on “nothingness” in Schopenhauer’s account of the sublime (Ch. 12) stands out for its clarity. It neither downplays metaphysics nor divorces it from aesthetics. As Hassan argues, Schopenhauer’s “idiosyncratic” metaphysical commitments “inform a decidedly existential account of the sublime that is interestingly distinct from competing positions” (170, original emphasis).

Part III turns to ethics, politics, and salvation. Colin Marshall and Kayla R. Mehl (Ch. 15) move beyond the usual dichotomy of self- versus other-regarding motives, developing a sophisticated, Scanlon-inspired ranking of moral worth across five dimensions. Drawing from parallels with Anscombe, Stephen Puryear (Ch. 16) reconstructs Schopenhauer’s account of moral obligation without recourse to divine law. Sean T. Murphy (Ch. 17) explores how self-knowledge of character can aid agents who struggle with indecisiveness regarding their identity and the path they wish to take in life. Curiously, none of these essays addresses (1) the ethical dimension of asceticism or self-control or (2) the metaphysical dimension of ethics that pinpoints a realm beyond appearances through a “felt knowledge of the delusiveness and nothingness of the forms of the representation that separate individuals” (WWR I §65).

David Bather Woods (Ch. 18) offers a creative interpretation of “Compassionate Contractarianism”, aligning it with Schopenhauer’s moral theory by emphasizing compassion as a motive for establishing the state. It is driven by a compassionate commitment to establish a state that protects fellow citizens from the consequences of their own wrongdoing, thereby supplementing the Hobbesian social contract theory—endorsed by Schopenhauer—which is based primarily on self-interested desire to escape the chaotic and fearful state of nature. Jakob Norberg (Ch. 19) examines Schopenhauer’s skeptical view of state authority, effectively responding to Woods. Byron Simmons (Ch. 20) reconstructs Schopenhauer’s case for pessimism, Jonathan Head (Ch. 21) critiques his views on religion, and Mathijs Peters (Ch. 22) confronts the apparent contradictions in Schopenhauer’s soteriology—the tension between one’s bondage to will and the possibility of one’s salvation through its denial.

Part 4 is devoted to a comprehensive analysis of Schopenhauer’s thought in the context of his antecedents (Spinoza, Rousseau, Kant) and (near-)contemporaries (Goethe, Hegel). In the introduction to Ch. 27, Yitzhak Y. Melamed observes that an adequate treatment of Schopenhauer’s engagement with Spinoza should include a discussion of various metaphysical notions and a comparative analysis of their respective metaphysical monisms. He further asserts that any genuine philosophical comparison between Schopenhauer and Spinoza “should begin by setting the record straight and clarifying the former’s mis-readings of the latter” (391).

This claim is disappointing, as Melamed does not provide a substantive discussion to support it; rather, he merely points to relevant passages from Schopenhauer in the footnotes. He notes that limited space prevents an extensive treatment of these matters and instead focuses on two central issues: “animal rights” and “evil”, which he contends are “at least as important as the others listed above” (391). While I agree that these issues are significant, to claim that they are at least as important as the metaphysical ones is, to say the least, an overstatement.

In the remainder of the chapter, Melamed rebukes Schopenhauer for his superficial characterization of Judaism as an optimistic creed. He remarks that, had Schopenhauer surveyed the “vast literature”, he would have realized that “there is no shortage of pessimistic sources within Judaism” (396). Nonetheless, Melamed contends, “it is pointless to preach the need for a nuanced and serious observation to someone, like Schopenhauer” (396). There is much to be said in defense of Schopenhauer on this point. At minimum, it should be noted that Judaism never advocates passive resignation or a wholesale withdrawal from the material world—this alone suffices for Schopenhauer to make his point. Accordingly, a comprehensive survey of the vast literature is unnecessary, and indeed, an unusual expectation. Furthermore, what makes Judaism problematic for Schopenhauer is that it operates primarily on the assumption of metaphysical realism, a position he rejects for various reasons discussed in Ch. 1 of this volume.

A similar tone appears in Keith Ansell-Pearson’s essay on Stoicism (Ch. 26). He favors Schopenhauer’s practical reflections for their being “less bound to his metaphysically supported philosophy of profound pessimism” (376), and declares, “I have no interest in a transcendent, metaphysical standpoint” (376). He further notes that

I […] dissent from the arrogant viewpoint Schopenhauer is most keen to promote […] namely, that no system prior to his has demonstrated so clearly the strong and intimate link that he alleges must exist between ‘metaphysics’ and ‘ethics’. (377)

I defer to the reader in judging the plausibility of these statements. Subsequent essays in this section adopt a less tendentious and more rigorous approach than the chapters discussed above. Sabine Roehr (Ch. 23) surveys Schopenhauer’s philosophy of history. Christopher Janaway (Ch. 24) presents a balanced argument that Schopenhauer’s sympathetic attitude toward Asian cultures can be seen as antithetical to Eurocentrism. However, since Schopenhauer’s primary motivation in engaging with non-European cultures is to critique and reform Europe, his attitude remains fundamentally Eurocentric. Mor Segev (Ch. 25) traces pessimism in antiquity. David James (Ch. 28) provides a perceptive analysis of Rousseau’s and Schopenhauer’s views on the (in)compatibility of compassion and self-love. He argues that Rousseau’s position is ultimately more realistic and, in my estimation, better aligned with contemporary approaches to the study of moral motivation, particularly when considering human psychological limits, than Schopenhauer’s. While Schopenhauer maintains that moral action must be motivated solely by compassion, Rousseau contends that “the moral demands of compassion cannot be so burdensome as to be incompatible with the demand of self-love” (407). Alejandro Naranjo Sandoval (Ch. 29) explores the ways in which Schopenhauer departs from Kantian orthodoxy with respect to the faculties of sensibility and understanding. Adrien Del Caro (Ch. 30) situates Schopenhauer as Goethe’s philosophical heir. Stephen Houlgate (Ch. 31) provides an insightful analysis of Schopenhauer’s turbulent relationship with his nemesis, Hegel.

Part 5 offers a comprehensive analysis of Schopenhauer’s influence on his successors (Kierkegaard, Wittgenstein, Adorno) and admirers (Wagner, Mann, Borges, Murdoch). Patrick Stokes (Ch. 32) shows that “Schopenhauer acts as a sort of whetstone for Kierkegaard, provoking him to sharpen his own stance” on living truthfully and authentically (470). Mark Berry (Ch. 33) meticulously traces how Wagner’s dramatic works draw upon the metaphysical framework established by Schopenhauer. Paul Bishop (Ch. 34) contrasts Nietzsche’s portrayal of Schopenhauer as a decadent figure who merely helped Wagner find his voice with Thomas Mann’s vision of Schopenhauer as a beacon of vitality and a lighthouse guiding the future self-realization of humanity. Michał Dobrzański (Ch. 35) reveals striking parallels between Schopenhauer and Wittgenstein, showing how the former’s philosophical approach shaped the latter’s reflections on the question of other minds (523) and the method of solving philosophical problems and errors rooted in language (525). Brian O’Connor (Ch. 36) presents a picture of a Schopenhauer whom Adorno found impossible to dismiss—one “willing to look at human experience without recourse to mythologies of consolation, naïve hope, or most importantly, acceptance” (542). Miles Leeson (Ch. 37) provides an insightful examination of Iris Murdoch’s evolving engagement with Schopenhauer, while Elizabeth Millán Brusslan concludes the volume with a compelling account of how Schopenhauer’s thought inspired Latin American youth in their struggle against oppressive regimes that stifled cultural and individual expression.

REFERENCES

All references to the first volume of The World as Will and Representation [WWR] are followed by the appropriate section number, and all references to the second volume by the chapter number followed by the page number. All references to Sämtliche Werke [Werke] are given with the respective volume and page numbers.

Reginster, Bernard (2009, August 3). Review of “The riddle of the world: A reconsideration of Schopenhauer’s philosophy,” by B. Hannan. Notre Dame Philosophical Reviews. https://ndpr.nd.edu/reviews/the-riddle-of-the-world-a-reconsideration-of-schopenhauers philosophy/.

Özen, Vasfi Onur (2020). “The ambiguity in Schopenhauer’s doctrine of the thing-in-itself,” The Review of Metaphysics, 74(2): 251–288.

Özen, Vasfi Onur (2023). “Schopenhauer on inner awareness and world-understanding,” British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 31(5): 1005–1027.

Schopenhauer, Arthur (1960). Sämtliche Werke. edited by A. Hübscher. Cotta-Insel. Stuttgart/Frankfurt am Main: Cotta-Verlag/Insel-Verlag Werke].

Schopenhauer, Arthur (1966). The World as Will and Representation. trans. E.F.J. Payne. 2 volumes. New York: Dover [WWR].