To paraphrase Kant's words on enlightenment, I propound that on the topic of transcendence and non-naturalism in Chinese and comparative philosophy, although we do not have a reckoned book yet, we finally have a book of reckoning.
Joshua R. Brown and Alexus McLeod discern two major reasons why scholars assume there is no robust idea of transcendence, and hence, take naturalism as an inevitable lens for interpreting early Chinese thought: Firstly, some of these scholars would like to find in early Chinese thought something that is different from the West, mainly from Christianity. Secondly, some of them would like to find in early Chinese thought something that looks the same as the West, viz., the same as the scientific and analytic mindset prevalent in Western academia since early modern Europe. Regardless, one common assumption has been taken by these apparently contrasting approaches: All these scholars take what is purported to be the West as a fixed and pre-established standard, and then read early Chinese thought against it. While doing so, they have overlooked other hermeneutical possibilities, firstly, that early Chinese thought may imply more than what comparisons via a set standard can tell. Secondly, the pre-established standard may itself not be adequate to the rich diversity and potentiality of Western thought. Therefore, what Brown and McLeod try to accomplish in this book is to prove there are a number of texts of early Chinese thought (such as the Chunqiu fanlu (CQFL), Xunzi, Laozi, Zhuangzi, Mozi, etc.) which can be interpreted fruitfully by means of a conversation with Western thinkers rich on transcendence and non-naturalism, such as Plotinus, Thomas Aquinas, Pseudo-Dionysius, etc. As a consequence, Brown and McLeod also urge the field of Chinese and comparative philosophy to pass the domination of "whether or not" questions concerning transcendence, and instead to ask more interesting questions such as "what these concepts were like in early China, what roles they played in both particular systems and broader swaths of the intellectual tradition, and in what ways early Chinese understandings of these concepts compare with those of other traditions." (193)
I celebrate that, because of their sophisticated analyses of so many early Chinese texts, Brown and McLeod have accomplished their goal. One good example of this is how they argue the transcendence of the Dao in perhaps still the most well-known ancient Chinese cosmology to the West, viz., Laozi's Dao De Jing. The text is frequently taken by scholars such as Roger Ames and Francois Jullien as the evidence par excellence that classical Chinese thought lacks the Western idea of hierarchical transcendence, since the Dao is interpreted by these scholars as a hidden force which unfolds within a single plane of being. In comparison, the Western conception of transcendence normally implies a supreme being on a superior plane of being which contrasts with the inferior ones.[1] However, Brown and McLeod argue: "Concepts of transcendence are meant to capture the idea that there are different orders of existence, some of which are outside of or in important ways not subject to the states and conditions of the orders of existence and the rest of the sensible world are subject to." (185) They also believe that there are good reasons for interpreting Laozi's Dao as indicating such a different order of existence. For instance, Dao is described by the initial chapter of Dao De Jing as "constant" (常), and therefore, although the Dao is surely a principle immanent to the process of growth and decay of worldly phenomena, we need to admit that "the process of growth and decay is not itself subject to the process of growth and decay." (151) By the same token, the change of world phenomena is conceptualized by the Dao De Jing as being caused by the interaction between the yin and yang aspects of the Dao. However, yin and yang are "how Dao maintains the generation of the phenomenal world, but the process does not work in reverse." (152) In other words, as causing the yin-yang change of the phenomenal world, the Dao itself cannot be changed by yin and yang in the same way things in the world are changed. All these analyses by Brown and McLeod demonstrate that Laozi's Dao indicates significant traits of transcendence, even if these traits may not belong to the hierarchical, contrastive type of transcendence against which Ames and Jullien read Laozi.
Although the goal of the book has been accomplished, not all of the concrete interpretations of selected early Chinese texts are convincing. This is mainly because the five key concepts of the framework employed by Brown and McLeod for the interpretations -- naturalism, non-naturalism, contrastive transcendence, non-contrastive transcendence, and non-transcendence -- are either not clearly defined, or while being clearly defined, not consistently applied in the course of interpretation. For instance, after investigating the ambiguous connotations of "naturalism" in contemporary philosophical scholarship, Brown and McLeod conclude by treating "naturalism" more as an affiliation claim than as a marker of a substantive philosophical position, and hence define "naturalism" as "a commitment to standing with the sciences, to adopting views and constructing systems that are respectable from the point of view of the physical sciences and their practitioners, or at least do not directly oppose them." (22) In tandem with this treatment of naturalism, they also define "contrastive transcendence" via a quote of Kathryn Tanner's theological work: In contrastive theories of transcendence, "divinity and the rest of the world taken as whole are viewed as logical contraries within a single spectrum: this forces an a priori separation of the two." (35) A non-contrastive transcendence of the divinity would underlie the entire spectrum of all beings in the world, and thus would imply that "divine involvement with the world need be neither partial, nor mediate, nor simply formative: if divinity is not characterized by contrast with any sort of being, it may be the immediate source of being of every sort." (36) In other words, a contrastive transcendence characterizes ultimate reality as a supreme being which stands alongside worldly beings and imposes an imperial order of existence upon the de facto existence of those beings. However, a non-contrastive transcendence explains the origin of the being of the world. While being itself is ultimately unknowable and ineffable, such a ground of being does not dictate what the world is apart from the existing empirical order of the world. Instead, the empirical order of the world would be the only means by which humans can know such an ultimate ground.
Among all the three mentioned concepts, naturalism has not been clearly defined, although Brown and McLeod may have good reasons not to do so. However, according to the presented conceptual framework, we envision there could be a serious philosophical endeavor to construct a worldview which is both transcendent in a non-contrastive mode and naturalistic in the sense that what the worldview presents is compatible with modern physical sciences. This also means that when we discern robust themes of transcendence in early Chinese texts, we cannot infer ipso facto that they are non-naturalistic. However, the core commitment of a philosophy cannot be both contrastively transcendent and naturalistic at the same time. Unfortunately, I find that Brown and McLeod frequently combine these logically inconsistent concepts to interpret selected early Chinese texts. For instance, while analyzing CQFL, they conclude: "in the cosmology of the CQFL, tian is understood in terms governed by contrastive transcendence but the text concomitantly embraces what are apparently both naturalistic and transcendental aspects of tian." (81) If Brown and McLeod were correct, the thought of CQFL would be incoherent since it is interpreted by them as advocating both the contrastive transcendence of tian, which impinges on the de facto order of the empirical world, and the naturalism of tian. The conclusion is surely worth debating. Similarly, while analyzing the Xunzi, Brown and McLeod say,
we think it is fair and accurate to interpret the Tianlun as defending some aspects of tian's transcendence . . . Consequently, far from seeing Xunzi as a poor naturalist, we think it is better to interpret him as a very unique and interesting non-naturalist, whose conception of tian should be placed in conversation with other non-naturalist conceptions of the world and the divine. (113)
Readers would wonder why Xunzi cannot be simultaneously transcendent and naturalistic, since this is a reasonable combination according to the adopted framework.
While remaining sympathetic with their overall goal of the book, in the remaining part of this review I will try to perfect Brown and McLeod's conceptual framework so as to pave a way for future scholars to more consistently and continually furnish novel and legitimate readings of the addressed early Chinese texts. The aforementioned five concepts can be refined as follows, and such a refinement would surely succumb to further critique.
I agree with Brown and McLeod that naturalism is a name of affiliation which speaks to one's commitment to the concept of "nature" fashioned by modern physical sciences. However, as indicated by historians and philosophers of science such as Karl Popper, Imre Lakatos, and Geoffrey Lloyd, this name of affiliation also designates a marker of a substantive philosophical position on "nature," which is predicated on the following two claims: Firstly, there is a set of orders which operates upon the totality of existing realities in the universe, and these orders can be discovered in the form of laws of nature via a bottom-up method of empirical observation and human reasoning. Whether these orders come from a deeper realm of being remains undefined by this concept of nature. Secondly, the set of orders is stable in the sense that these orders remain uninfluenced by unpredictable metaphysical entities, such as souls, spirits and other magical forces which may also exist among the realities of the observed world, and hence the discovered laws of nature are testable, falsifiable, and improvable so that the knowledge of nature can progress on the basis of accumulative human endeavors within scientific communities. Still, whether these unpredictable metaphysical entities exist and whether they come from another realm of being remain unanswered by this concept of nature. In a word, naturalism would refer to a worldview which either affirms or remains compatible with the two conditional claims: the order of the existing world can be discovered empirically via human reason, and the order is recognized as being stable in a certain degree so that derived laws of nature remain debatable. According to this re-definition of "naturalism," the so-called naturalistic transition detected by Brown and McLeod in early Han texts cannot be assessed as strictly naturalistic, since as admitted by Brown and McLeod (84 and 92), the correlative cosmology of early Han texts enchants the world. Such an enchantment makes the world so full of omens, signs, and mysterious resonances among apparently unrelated things that, as pointed out by Joseph Needham,[2] the theories that are used by early Han thinkers to explain the worldly phenomena, such as the one of yin-yang vital energy and five phases, cannot be seen as laws of nature in the strict sense of modern physical sciences.
Non-naturalism would be a view of nature that denies the validity of either of the two conditional claims which naturalism as defined makes. This explains further why an enchanted worldview of early Han cannot be seen as fully naturalistic, since it complies with part of the first condition of naturalism, but is not compatible with the second.
A view of non-transcendence would affirm that the totality of existing realities in the universe has no origin other than themselves. I also agree with Brown and Alexus's conceptions of contrastive and non-contrastive transcendence, and would furthermore indicate that this distinction is essentially the same as the one by which Paul Tillich distinguishes God as "a supreme being" from "the ground of being." Consequently, a view of transcendence would aver that the totality of existing realities in the universe cannot explain the origin of themselves, and thus need another realm of being for such an explanation, regardless of whether this original realm of being is contrastive or not.
According to this refined conceptual framework, we can envision multiple possibilities of combination and be better positioned to interpret varying philosophies. For instance, both naturalism and non-naturalism can be non-transcendent. A non-transcendent naturalism would imply the self-sufficiency of the scientifically perceived world to explain itself, whereas a non-transcendent non-naturalism would present an enchanted world not supervised by a supreme deity, such as the one which may be envisioned by astrology, alchemy or other so-called pseudo-sciences. Furthermore, a naturalism could be non-contrastively transcendent. This would be the case when what a thing is gets explained by the de facto relationship among things, whereas where a thing comes from gets explained by another realm of being which does not impinge upon the empirical order of the existing world. However, naturalism cannot be contrastively transcendent unless the order implied by the divine realm of being remains compatible with the empirical order of the existing world. We cannot find an easy example of such a compatibility particularly in the Abrahamic religions, since the idea of a supreme God normally implies a divine plan which is conceived by God even prior to the existence of the world. Moreover, a non-naturalism could be either non-contrastively transcendent, when an enchanted world is said to derive from an ultimately ineffable God, or contrastively transcendent, when the enchanted world is thought of as being grounded within such a divine origin.
If we employ this refined conceptual framework to interpret early Chinese thought, we'll garner new insights. For instance, CQFL would present a non-naturalistic view of the enchanted world with a contrastively transcendent Tian, which governs the world providentially. Laozi's Dao De Jing presents a naturalistic Daoist view of nature with a non-contrastive transcendence, but such a view does not prioritize the role of human beings in realizing the cosmic Dao in the human world. However, the Xici (the Appended Texts of the Classic of Change) presents a naturalistic Ruist (Confucian) view of nature with a non-contrastive transcendence, which does prioritize the role of humanity in realizing the humane manifestation of the cosmic Dao. Moreover, the Xunzi presents a mainly naturalistic Ruist view of nature with a mainly non-transcendent view of Tian, because although Tian is still treated as being the evolutionary origin of existing things in the universe, humans are encouraged by Xunzi to utilize Tian to serve the flourishing of human society and, hence, to strip Tian of its divine depth. The view of Mozi would be both non-naturalistic and contrastively transcendent, since the text advocates both the existence of ghosts and the supreme status of Tian as a providential deity.
I would not claim that the refined framework is the right way to interpret early Chinese thought. However, concurring with Brown and McLeod's urge to ask more interesting questions of Chinese and comparative philosophy concerning transcendence, I do think we need more refined comparative categories to treat both Western and non-Western thought with more respect, nuances, and novelties.
REFERENCES
Song, Bin (2020). A review of Apophatic Paths from Europe to China: Regions without Borders, by William Franke (State University of New York Press, 2018). Journal of the American Academy of Religion, Volume 88, Issue 1 (2020): 278-281.
Needham, Joseph (1956). Science and Civilization in China, Vol. II (Cambridge University Press).