The concept of structural injustice is at the core of many current debates on justice and injustice in political philosophy. It appears to capture something important about many structural wrongs we consider to be not just prolific and morally bad, but also unjust. Examples of structural injustice discussed in the literature are chains of global labor exploitation, structural racism, and sexism, but also private exchanges mediated through markets. Famously, Iris Marion Young discusses the examples of production chains in the global textile industry (Young 1996) and seemingly “morally neutral” exchanges on the housing market leading to the near-homelessness of vulnerable persons (Young 2011, 43–4).
This collection, edited by Jude Browne and Maeve McKeown, brings together the voices of leading scholars working on the concept of structural injustice, and is an especially welcome one. It not only provides an extremely useful survey of the current debates on structural injustice, but it also explores new paths for future research. The editors start from the (undoubtedly correct) observation that the notion of structural injustice is “subject to many theoretical and empirical interpretations and a great deal of confusion” (1). The impressive array of contributions then sets out to address that confusion by discussing ontological, moral, and epistemological points of contention. The contributions to the volume are very varied both in content and style. Without being able to do justice to the rich and multifaceted character of the collection, I will concentrate on two of its central strands of inquiry: (i) the question of what exactly structural injustice is, and (ii) the topic of how exactly to conceptualize the responsibility to remedy structural injustice. At the end, I will briefly mention some other topics covered in the volume.
Tellingly, Browne and McKeown have called their volume “What Is Structural Injustice?” It is unsurprising, therefore, that questions of social ontology and agency take center stage in many of the contributions. How exactly do individual agents act under structural constraints? Can individuals alter or dismantle social structures in any meaningful way? In her original contribution “Transformative Action as Structural and Publicly Constituted” Mara Marin offers what one could call a theory of deliberative uptake for resistance to structural injustice. She emphasizes that individual agency is not only conditioned and made meaningful by recourse to social structures, but that it is also structural in a different sense—namely, in that it needs to be taken up and interpreted by the right kind of public and public processes. Thus, for resistance with regard to structural injustice to work, it is not individual intentions which matter, but whether individual acts are taken up by public (possibly transformative) reinterpretative deliberations. The same individual action can be interpreted in radically different ways by different publics. Although Marin also stresses that there is always an element of contingency and unpredictability which individual agents can introduce (at times Marin even suggests that this is their only way to act meaningfully, 32), this nevertheless makes the transformative power of individual acts dependent on their uptake by the right kinds of deliberative communities.
In a similar vein, Sally Haslanger, in her contribution “Agency under Structural Constraints in Social Systems,” starts from the question of how individual agency can be conceptualized under the conditions of complex social systems. Haslanger defines systems as tokens of “structure-types” (49). For example, one particular family consisting of Anna, Ben, and Clara is a particular instantiation, and hence a family-system, of the structure-type “family.” Systems consist of positions or nodes (and of the occupiers of such positions) and are connected by relationships (49). Relationships emerge in social practices (52 ff.). Being in a particular structure—e.g., being in a parent-child relation defined by law, politics, and social norms—constrains and enables action. While practices do not determine our action, they do provide what Haslanger calls a “choice architecture” (57). Individual agents can aspire to change the structural constraints and practices under which they are acting, for example by applying given social meanings in new ways, thereby “creating conceptual and practical connections that generate new options (and new constraints) for agency” (Haslanger 2023, 58). However, Haslanger also stresses that structures—and thereby unjust systems—tend to be stable and particularly robust over time. She identifies three reasons for this. First, action that conforms to a social practice is intelligible to others, while costs for deviations are high (60). Second, structures organize and reproduce power relations. Finally, the material basis of practices are difficult to alter (61). All of this helps explain structural stability. Haslanger’s conclusion is that “Social reproduction, then, creates subjects who enact unjust structures, often unknowingly and unwillingly” (62).
The question of how to conceptualize the interplay of individual agency on the one hand and structural factors on the other is also tackled by Maeve McKeown’s paper “Pure, Avoidable and Deliberate Structural Injustice.” McKeown takes issue with accounts—such as, for instance, Young’s and Haslanger’s—which rely on Anthony Gidden’s structuration theory. Against views which explain the interplay of individual and structural agency as one of mutual dependence or even (co-)constitution, McKeown suggests subscribing to a critical realist ontology, according to which individual agency on the one hand and the structural organization of possibilities to act on the other hand must be kept separate. McKeown thereby denies that structures and agents must be viewed as ontologically “inseparable” (68 ff.). Acknowledging this, she argues, helps us come to terms with the “emergentist” character of social structures as well as with the causal properties of social relationships, which on McKeown’s view cannot be reduced to individual agency. McKeown rightly points out that structures do not determine individual actions; they instead order them by attaching different opportunity costs to different types of actions (74). Since this is something Young and Haslanger emphasize too, I am not entirely convinced that presupposing Gidden’s structuration theory necessarily entails a strict ontological identification of structural and individual agency, as McKeown claims. Given that McKeown then argues for a power-based account, one particularly interesting avenue for further research might be to link these discussions from social theory and social ontology to debates on social power, i.e., on how individuals’ powers are structurally co-constituted (Jugov 2020, Abizadeh 2021).
A second set of questions that has been at the forefront of the debate on structural injustice are the following: what kind of normative wrong is structural injustice? In virtue of which of its features is it unjust? Are individuals morally blameworthy for their participation in structural injustice and what kind of responsibility do individual agents have with respect to its rectification? It is with regard to these questions that the contributions to this volume have particularly interesting answers to offer. According to Young’s definition, the concept of structural injustice refers to unjust social processes (Young 2011, 52). However, Young stresses that individual persons who contribute to upholding these processes do not meet the usual criteria for liability and moral blame responsibility, since their individual contributions are causally neither necessary nor sufficient for bringing the structured harm about, and they are unintended and unforeseeable (Young 2011, 105 ff.). Individuals help to bring about structural injustices simply by participating in everyday life and by following customary rules—not by violating legal or moral norms (Young 2011, 52; 95). While Young acknowledges that our implication in unjust social processes might ground responsibilities to remedy them, she emphasizes the forward-looking and collectively shared “political” character of such responsibilities.
A number of different objections have been raised against Young’s view. One fundamental worry concerns the question of what type of normative wrong structural injustice is, if individuals cannot be said to violate their moral duties in bringing it about. After all, injustices warrant grievances only if some set of culprits committing them can be identified (Estlund 2024, 335ff.). One answer to this question is presented by Catherine Lu. Lu’s paper starts with analyzing the example of Mary Johns, a Canadian of indigenous descent, who was murdered in 1982. Her murderer received no or very lenient sentencing for the murdering of several indigenous women. Lu argues that the wrong of structural injustice “refers to the unjust structural processes or conditions that enabled the production of interactional wrongs or structural harms” (112)—for example, when an intersecting array of social structures leads to a persistently heightened vulnerability for indigenous women and girls to all forms of gender-based violence (107). Thereby, Lu reads Young’s model of political responsibility as entailing individual moral responsibilities (113). As Lu underlines, Young holds that agents “can and should be criticized” (ibid., cf. Young 2011, 144) for failing to fulfill their respective responsibilities. Lu argues that Young eschews the “language of blame and fault-finding” with regard to structural injustice for practical reasons, due to their “disutility” in forging the necessary social transformations” (ibid.). While I agree with Lu’s observation that our responsibilities to remedy structural injustice must be rooted in moral commitments, I am less sure about her characterization of structural injustice in terms of “enabling” interactional moral wrongs (along with structural harms). Isn’t structural injustice precisely unjust in and of itself, even if it were not to lead to other harms? For example, aren’t sexist or racist structures unjust, even if individual men or white persons were to carefully avoid taking advantage of them on an individual level and potentially even if no structural forms of harm were detectable? I believe that the question of what type of normative wrong structural injustice precisely is warrants further discussion and Lu’s article certainly develops a very helpful contribution to that debate.
Another important objection against Young’s account of structural injustice doubts whether there really are no agents to whom some type of moral blame responsibility can be attributed. Several authors in the volume argue that agents such as individuals, corporations, or states are not as morally blameless as Young suggests they are. For example, in her contribution, McKeown claims that in cases which she dubs “avoidable structural injustice” the privileged continue to act in ways that lead to foreseeable and avoidable forms of structural injustice (79 ff.). States could end homelessness by altering the regulatory framework of housing-markets—but they don’t. Similarly, Montouvalou in her contribution “Structures of Injustice, the Law, and Exploitative Work” points to legal arrangements which sometimes create or sustain structurally unjust arrangements, even if this only occurs by the unintended effects of an intersecting array of different laws and rulings. Montouvalou discusses an example of how a combination of the British Welfare reform act and major rulings concerning the role of work agencies forces workers to take up exploitative and precarious agency work (249). Last but not least, in her wonderfully clear paper “Gender Inequality, Structural Injustice, and Political Responsibility” (which is one of two reprinted papers included in the volume) Serena Parekh makes a convincing case for states being the central agents who should bear political responsibility—and therefore correct for forms of structural injustice brought about by purportedly private “patterns of conduct” (for example those leading to gender inequality). McKeown concludes that there sometimes may very well be elite, political, or legal agents who perpetuate structural injustices in foreseeable or even deliberate ways. Montouvalou and Parekh both point to the role of the state as an agent of “last resort” with regard to correcting structural injustice. These arguments are compelling and interesting, and open up novel avenues for research, for example on how to distinguish collective and shared types of responsibilities. Such arguments are also important reminders of Martha Nussbaum’s critique of Young’s distinction between retrospective guilt and prospective political responsibility (Nussbaum 2011, xxi). For if we grant agents such as states or political elites a “free pass” with regard to responsibilities neglected in the past, their incentive to act on prospective political responsibilities to correct for structural injustice might dwindle.
By contrast, in her excellent contribution “The Untraceability of Structural Injustice” Jude Browne defends Young’s assumption that individuals do not commit individual wrongs when participating in structural injustice. Against arguments aspiring to reduce structural injustices to aggregate forms of individual wronging—for example by construing them as cases of indirect discrimination, as Andrea Sangiovanni has recently suggested—Browne points to ways in which the structural dimension of injustice is irreducible. Against Sangiovanni’s variations of the “harmless torturer” example (in which a person will get tortured, only if all of fifty million switches are flipped by individual agents), Browne firstly emphasizes that the character of structural injustice is less obviously of a morally problematic sort and secondly argues that in cases such as global capitalism individuals can know that they participate in an injustice, even while not knowing exactly how to stop the practice in question (95). While individuals in the harmless torturer example do know exactly what they ought to do in order to stop their participation in the collective harm, it is less clear what individuals need to do in order to stop their engagement in structural injustices like global capitalism or racism.
This edited volume is an excellent starting point for thinking about these important issues. Moreover, it also features an array of interesting essays with a different focus. For example, Jonathan Wolff’s opening piece “Structural Harm, Structural Injustice, Structural Repair” offers an extremely valuable overview of the debate and also investigates neighboring concepts such as structural harm (16 ff.). This essay may prove particularly helpful in the classroom as a good overview and introduction to the debates surrounding the concept of structural injustice. In a similar vein, Jade Schiff examines the connections between the concept of structural injustice and vulnerability in her essay “Structural Injustice and the Two Faces of Vulnerability” and Alasia Nuti links the debate on structural injustice to that of historical injustice in her essay “Towards a pluralistic account of Structural Injustice.” Both essays offer valuable insights into how the notion of structural injustice relates to these other concepts. Other essays are more applied in character. Ryoa Chung’s essay, for example, examines how Global Structural Health Inequalities were reproduced by the vaccine distribution during the Covid-19 pandemic. Another important strand of the debate on structural injustice, to which the edited volume provides important novel elements, are epistemological questions. Such questions are approached from explicitly decolonial perspectives, such as by Lewis R. Gordon in his essay “Decolonizing Structural Justice and Political Responsibility” and by Brooke Ackerly in her essay “Murmurations of Injustice: Dynamics of Structural Injustice and Epistemic Oppression.” Last but not least, Alison M. Jagger and Theresa W. Tobin also shed light on the epistemological dimension of structural injustice in their contribution “Moral Justification and Structural Epistemic Injustice.”
REFERENCES
Abizadeh, Arash 2021 “The Power of Numbers: On Agential-Power-With-Others without Power-Over-Others” in: Philosophy & Public Affairs, 49 (3), 290–318.
Estlund, David 2023 “What’s Unjust about Structural Injustice?” In: Ethics, 134 (4), 333–359.
Jugov, Tamara 2020 “Systemic Domination as Ground of Justice”, in: European Journal of Political Theory, 19 (1), 47–66.
Nussbaum, Martha 2011 “Foreword to Responsibility and Global Justice”. Oxford New York: Oxford University Press. Ix–xxv.
Young, Iris-Marion 2006 “Responsibility and Global Justice: A Social Connection Model, in: Social Philosophy and Policy, 23 (1), 102–130.
Young, Iris Marion 2011 Responsibility and Global Justice. Oxford New York: Oxford University Press.