It is hard not to warm to a book whose preface begins: ‘This book is about the greatest chickpea in the history of humanity’ (‘Cicero’ being the Latin for ‘chickpea’). The opening words give a pretty good flavour of the book’s light, conversational style. However, as one might gather from the title, it also carries a serious message—that at a moment of peril for contemporary democracy, under threat from populism and authoritarianism alike, Cicero still has important things to say. It is not, to judge from its style and content, aimed at a philosophically sophisticated audience, but at a wider readership for whom Cicero may be little more than a name but who are curious to find out about his ideas and how they might be of relevance over two millennia after they were written down.
The book consists of an Introduction, six, quite brief chapters, and an Epilogue. The Introduction sets out its stall in relation to Ancient Rome by bemoaning the continued appeal of the figure of Julius Caesar, the paradigm of a ruthless dictator, in comparison with the more subdued presence in the popular imagination of Caesar’s contemporary and (by and large) fierce opponent Cicero, champion of the constitutional order—a hierarchy that the book aspires to do something to overturn.
Chapter 1 presents Cicero as an epitome of ‘Homo Philosophicus’, one whose life as a leading politician in the late Roman republic was ‘grounded on a philosophical vision’ (29). The chapter contrasts this more rounded conception of what it is to be human with a view of humankind as ‘Homo Oeconomicus’, whereby ‘material advancement in the form of monetary gain is. . .universally lauded’ (20). As a genuine (and rare) philosopher-politician, Cicero can help us find a ‘feasible alternative to the destructive trajectory of advanced capitalism’ (20).
Chapter 2 focusses on Cicero’s work On Duties (De Officiis), in particular Book 1, and claims for it a communitarian conception of justice with an egalitarian flavour that foreshadows themes in Rousseau and Marx, as well as a reminder that the unjust pursuit of selfish interests at the expense of the common good threatens the survival of our own institutions as much as it did those of the Roman republic.
Chapter 3 covers Cicero’s conception of the political community in his De Re Publica (On the Republic) and develops a picture of Cicero as an important precursor of the republican political tradition, where freedom is conceptualised principally as the absence of subjection to the exercise of a ruler’s arbitrary power, and political participation, with its attendant civic duties, is paramount. The chapter contrasts this outlook, on the whole favourably, with the more individualistic liberal tradition in political thought that places emphasis on our rights and on a conception of freedom as the ability to fulfil one’s goals without external interference. Cicero’s participatory conception of civic life is seen as bringing with it a strong egalitarian dimension.
Chapter 4 discusses Cicero’s view of friendship as found mainly in his work On Friendship (De Amicitia), bringing out how for Cicero friendship is an intrinsic rather than merely an instrumental good, and is fundamentally a relationship in which the participants treat each other as equals. There is thus a strong social and political dimension to friendship on this view, reinforcing the idea of civic equality developed in the previous chapter.
In Chapter 5, Cicero’s view on old age is considered, with particular reference to his work On Old Age (De Senectute). This chapter emphasizes Cicero’s enlightened view of the possibilities for older people to continue making important contributions to society. Indeed it suggests that Cicero has a ‘republican’ view of old age such that we have a duty to take care of ourselves while young in order to enhance our ability to serve the common good when older.
Chapter 6 returns to highlight the importance of philosophy to Cicero’s political outlook and pushes back against the idea that he can be dismissed as (merely) a conservative thinker, instead urging us to see him as having much to say to those of a progressive and even egalitarian outlook.
The Epilogue seeks to summarise Cicero’s relevance for our contemporary age, and its challenges, by holding him out as an advocate of political liberty and equality, and a fierce opponent of corruption. A Ciceronian vision of civic participation, with a commensurate duty on citizens to educate and inform themselves, can help us resist the malign forces that threaten the democratic structures we have come (unwisely) to take for granted.
It is refreshing to have a vigorous case made for Cicero that is aimed at a non-specialist audience. Vittorio Bufacchi is clearly a fan. If anything, I would have liked to see a bit more Cicero in the book. Bufacchi’s treatment of Cicero’s writings tends to be somewhat sketchy, though this is understandable given the book’s aims. If it succeeds in whetting the reader’s appetite for more Cicero, it will have served its purpose.
Given the book’s interest in his contemporary relevance, Cicero’s scepticism might also have received a little more coverage. Chapter 4 raises, and rather contentiously rejects, the idea that Cicero would have approved of modern social media, at least if responsibly used. The ‘post-truth’ (91) universe that social media has come to inhabit is of course a ripe target for criticism. But perhaps a still greater, if not unconnected, blight is its habit of creating echo chambers where true believers sit in their own silos talking to each other, and no one ever changes their mind.
In this regard, it may be significant that Bufacchi has almost nothing to say about Cicero’s great ethical work De Finibus (On Moral Ends), in which a series of ethical theories are first propounded and then critiqued. The work’s structure offers support for the idea of a Ciceronian scepticism according to which, as Bufacchi acknowledges (48), certainty is not to be sought. Arguments for the most part have counter-arguments: a stance that can be taken as encouraging open-mindedness and respect for another’s point of view.
It is a shame, then, that it goes unmentioned by Bufacchi that a number of Cicero’s philosophical works—including De Finibus—were written as dialogues, which would in turn have given weight to Bufacchi’s observation that Cicero’s method is ‘grounded on philosophical deliberation and debate’ (49). By the same token, while I am sure that Bufacchi is right to say that for Cicero this approach ‘is our best hope to recognize and agree on what is most probably true’ (49), I am not sure that agreement on the (probable) truth goes to the heart of why Cicero matters when contemporary issues of communication are at stake. On this, it seems to me that a norm of respectful disagreement, and a concomitant commitment to ongoing enquiry, would be both a more balanced reflection of the Ciceronian position and a more powerful antidote to the ills of social media. Still, this is just an example of how Bufacchi’s engagement with Cicero is apt to stimulate in ways that bear upon some of the most pressing matters that confront us today.
Another topic, lying at the core of Bufacchi’s case for Cicero, is democratic politics and its discontents. The moral of the Ciceronian story that the book draws, to paraphrase roughly, is that we need a bit more participatory republicanism and a bit less liberal individualism. The contrast developed between these two approaches is for me the philosophically richest aspect of Bufacchi’s account. Yet I wondered if pushing things a bit further philosophically might have helped even more.
What I have in mind here is Bufacchi’s emphasis on the role of duties within the republican framework. His discussion of On Duties pays tribute to Cicero’s ‘strong sense of morality, public and private’ (51), and continues:
That’s why the twenty-first century needs Cicero: we need to go back to the basics of morality and obligation, and we need to find the moral force to resist violence and fraud. In our present predicament we could do a lot worse than to rediscover. . .On Duties.
Worthy sentiments no doubt. But they raise a question, one that goes back at least as far as Plato: Why should someone follow the path of morality and obligation? Why resist violence and fraud if committing violence and fraud furthers one’s ends? Why, to put it in terms of Bufacchi’s own framing, not be a Caesar? The latter’s demise at the hands of assassins perhaps only adds to the glamour without really persuading us that this is the wrongdoer’s inexorable fate, or that what preceded it didn’t amply compensate for that fate.
Bufacchi puts things a little misleadingly in stating that the Cicero of On Duties is interested in understanding ‘why one should act morally even when non-moral behaviour is more advantageous’ (41). What is distinctive about On Duties Bufacchi goes on to clarify with a quote from section 3.49 of that work (42): ‘Let it be set down as an established principle. . .that what is morally wrong can never be expedient.’ This is a radical principle indeed and Book 3 of the work contains rich discussion and elaboration of it. The brevity of Bufacchi’s own treatment rather leaves the impression of Cicero as dull moraliser and retailer of implausible paradox rolled, oddly, into one. A fuller discussion would, I think, have revealed a Cicero both more interesting and more coherent than that.
That said, Bufacchi is a far from uncritical admirer of Cicero as philosopher-politician; indeed chapter 6 has a section headed ‘Cicero’s failings’ (118). His reproof of Cicero’s lack of concern for issues of economic, as opposed (if they really can be opposed) to moral and political, equality is well-merited. As Bufacchi wryly notes, a treatise on Cicero’s theory of economic justice ‘could possibly turn into the world’s shortest book.’ (120)
If anything, Bufacchi at times underplays the problem. Cicero’s strictures at On Duties 3.21 against the injustice of one’s taking something from one’s neighbour, quoted at 58, sound unimpeachable and are treated as such by Bufacchi, indeed as no less than ‘a moral argument that could be used today against modern capitalism’ (57). Yet back at 2.73–4 Cicero had condemned the very idea of egalitarian (re)distribution, then warned against the imposition of a property tax, under the general rubric of non-interference by the state in the property rights of its citizens: ‘(property) taxation is theft’ may not be quite the fulmination against capitalism we were led to expect from a glance at 3.21 in isolation.
Our hero, it turns out, has his flaws. It is to Bufacchi’s credit that these are given a decent airing, and that he has produced not a hagiography, but a brisk, entertaining, and highly engaged reading of a figure who, one suspects, would have approved of Bufacchi’s reaching out beyond the ivory tower to advocate for the continuing relevance of Cicero homo philosophicus in our own troubled age—and not just because it was about him.