Four Views on Free Will (2nd edition)

The first edition of Four Views on Free Will appeared some seventeen years ago as a compelling addition to Blackwell’s “Great Debates in Philosophy” series. As I emphasized in a review here at that time, the volume was (and remains) remarkable both as a high-level introduction to the contemporary debate about freedom and responsibility and as a model of constructive and cooperative philosophy. I am happy to report that the second edition only improves on the initial excellences. Still, a natural question to ask is whether, in light of the first edition’s standing strengths, a second edition is justified. My answer to this question is a full-throated yes. Not only does it contain new and provocative first-order thinking about the core issues, including intriguing developments and concessions among the authors regarding their target positions; it also demonstrates afresh and across time how philosophy can and should be done collectively and with serious shared attention to the details of the moral life. Because of the exceedingly rare combination of expertise, depth, cooperation, and accessibility in this volume, there is no better resource for entering into the lively philosophical discussion of the problem of free will and for taking the measure of the current state of the debate.

The opening position chapters (1–4) have each been substantially re-written and not merely “updated.” In general, these chapters do more than they did in the first edition to give general expression to the wider impulses of the target positions. While readers of the first four chapters will certainly come away with a clear view of each author’s distinctive views (with more detail emerging in the response chapters), they will also be able to appreciate the broader unifying features of each of the four basic positions. This is to say that the authors stake out their respective and influential positions by doing more than they originally did to situate themselves within the traditional framing. Further, the response chapters (chapters 5–8) place the authors in fresh critical engagement with one another and with the wider and vibrant philosophical literature that has developed over the past decade and a half. After sketching the position chapters, I will give specific attention to two illuminating tensions that arise in the response chapters and conclude by proffering an alternative position not seriously considered in the volume.

The first chapter belongs to Robert Kane who defends the libertarian view.^[1] The broad category encompasses any position according to which we enjoy free will and yet would not enjoy it were the thesis of determinism true. That is, the libertarian is both an incompatibilist and an indeterminist. Kane has done as much as any philosopher over the past half-century to motivate both features of the libertarian view. His chapter tightly presents many of his characteristic efforts—his appeal to self-forming actions, his eschewing “extra-factor views” of the acting self, and his unique approach to luck objections, for example. Ultimately, he announces in this chapter what many will see as a new and surprising element of his libertarian position: namely, his embrace of a form of agent-causalism.

John Martin Fischer defends the compatibilist position in the second chapter. According to the compatibilist, there is no formal conflict between the thesis of determinism and the claim that we enjoy freedom of will. Fischer frames his discussion of this position in terms of what he takes to be a key animating intuition, which is that our status as morally responsible agents ought to be resilient in the face of the various ways the universe could turn out to be. Compatibilism, he claims, best accommodates the thought that our moral self-image could not seriously be threatened by the outcome of scientific investigation into the workings of the laws of nature. By appealing to both the force of the consequence argument and the upshot of Frankfurt-style cases, Fischer goes on to introduce and defend his distinctive position—semi compatibilism—according to which the possession of alternative possibilities is not necessary for free and responsible agency. Fischer also presents his rightly influential positive account of the conditions for morally responsible agency in terms of proper responsiveness to reasons.

In the third chapter, Derk Pereboom defends free will skepticism. While the traditional skeptical position in the free will debate has been hard determinism, Pereboom offers, instead, his “hard incompatibilism.” The difference is this: according to the traditional hard determinist, the reason we lack free will is that the thesis of determinism is true—and free will is incompatible with determinism. Pereboom agrees that determinism would rule out the relevant form of free will; but he resists the idea that only this thesis would threaten freedom. Pereboom argues, in his now characteristic fashion, that we would lack free will if determinism were true (as a manipulation argument shows) and we would lack free will if determinism were false (as various “luck” objections show). He further advances his broader project of rendering the moral world safe under skepticism by continuing to argue that important forms of love, moral protest, gratitude, and criminal justice need not be threatened by the acceptance of hard incompatibilism.

The fourth chapter gives Manuel Vargas the opportunity to explicate and defend “revisionism” about free will. Put in the broadest terms, a revisionist is anyone who thinks that the truth about free will is not captured by commonsense views of the matter; that is, the revisionist believes that getting things right in this domain will require us to revise our account away from ordinary folk judgment. As it turns out, Vargas’s distinctive version involves the descriptive claim that folk views about free will are decidedly libertarian and the prescriptive claim that we ought to accept a substantively compatibilist conception of free will—both because libertarianism is empirically implausible and because a compatibilist conception best fills the functional role required by our free will language and practices. The central line of argument in favor of the compatibilist aspect of the prescriptive claim proceeds by way of a fascinating developmental just-so story about the role of anger in the management of the forms of cooperative relationships that can be thought to constitute morality. The upshot of this approach is that each of Vargas’s interlocutors is right about something important to the debate (Kane about our instincts toward libertarianism, Fischer about the viability of a compatibilist approach, and Pereboom about the need to abandon commonsense); but they are each wrong to work within a philosophical methodology that allows folk judgments about freedom and responsibility to play a definitive role.

Turning to the response chapters (5–8), a great deal of excellent critical and creative work is done in these respective replies. I will only be able to underline two important particulars here. First, as mentioned above, Robert Kane (chapter 5) uses a good bit of his response to Pereboom to develop his new proposal—though he suggests in places that it was implicit in his earlier renderings—aimed at thwarting Pereboom’s “disappearing agent” objection. As Pereboom has framed this concern, the indeterminism required by Kane’s event causal account appears to allow the outcome of a supposedly free action to result from a process that makes no essential appeal to the agent as such. While the agent causal libertarian may be able to avoid this objection, Pereboom has suggested that any event causal view of free action that insists on the necessity of indeterminism will have to confront it. In a striking response, Kane here insists that “one does not have to choose between agent (or substance) causation and event causation in accounting for free agency, libertarian or otherwise.” He goes on: “You can, indeed you must, affirm both” (180). To avoid the complaint that the appeal to the agent-as-cause will conflict with his famed opposition to “extra-factor” views, Kane suggests that the agent is to be understood not as a spooky substance of the Kantian or Chisholmian variety but as a “complex dynamical system,” which he implies can be characterized in acceptably naturalistic terms. While each of the non-libertarian authors raise challenging concerns about the wider Kanean approach to indeterminism, it seems to me that more attention will need to be given to the coherence and empirical plausibility of this new element of Kane’s final view.

A second element worth emphasizing from the response chapters involves a wide-scope shift in the debate as it has unfolded over the past two decades. What I am drawing attention to here is the way that the methodology of the free will debate has moved so sharply into the foreground. This shift in attention is likely due to two features on display in the volume itself. On the one hand, the authors are clearly committed to understanding each other in honest and charitable ways (and this is an admirable feature of the contemporary debate itself, I judge). The disagreement, then, cannot easily be chalked up either to ignorance or intransigence. Still, disagreement remains. To turn attention to methodology is a respectful way to approach the persistence of the “dialectical stalemates” (as Fischer has aptly called them). On the other hand, the emergence of Vargas’s revisionism has pressed the contemporary debate to be increasingly explicit about its methodology. In particular, every theorist has been forced to reconsider both the role of commonsense judgment in theorizing about free will and their aims in this theorizing. A practical upshot of this methodological turn may be that there is actually less disagreement among contemporary theorists than there appears to be. Or, put another way, it may be that getting clear about the methodological options reveals a wider set of essential elements of agreement. As a case in point from the volume, Fischer, Pereboom, and Vargas all clearly agree that responsiveness to reasons can ground a serious form of moral responsibility—with conflicts remaining, to be sure, about whether this is the form about which we were always concerned in the free will debate. In any case, and in light of the dynamics of the debate in the volume, I suspect that meta-philosophy will increasingly drive the ongoing discussion.

In this spirit, I present a position that seems to me to be a worthy alternative to those on offer in the volume. Call it “aspirational libertarianism.” An aspirational libertarian will have their eyes wide-open to the forms of complaint leveled against Kane’s position (and against other promising libertarian views like those developed by Timothy O’Connor, E.J. Lowe, and Christian List) and to the impressive efforts of compatibilists to develop concrete proposals that save a good deal of ordinary moral life from the threats of determinism and reductivism. However, an aspirational libertarian will also be alive to the limits of compatibilist views regarding our deepest hopes for ourselves as agents. The sense that something valuable would be unattainable in a causally closed universe is not obviously misleading. In the face of these tensions, an aspirationalist will argue that libertarian commitment remains rational on evaluative grounds, because the costs of abandoning it are, at present, too high. We ought, in short, to remain hopeful that the structure of the universe permits the full-blooded indeterministic agency of ordinary moral expectations. Such hope is compatible with a great deal of gratitude for compatibilist advances and with clear-eyed awareness that the hope may one day, as a consequence of further empirical and conceptual inquiry, prove irrational. What an aspirational libertarian will emphasize is that it is not this day, overwrought scientistic pronouncements notwithstanding.

Turning away from such provincial matters to conclude very briefly, then, the second edition of Four Views on Free Will uniquely introduces the core issues of the contemporary debate while also advancing our understanding along a number of new trajectories. Those familiar with the first edition will be able to see what it looks like for the central cooperative project to have continued for a further two decades, with important results. Those who will be jumping directly into this second edition will be on the cutting edge and in the best of hands.